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Gottlob Frege
Gottlob Frege (b. 1848, d. 1925) was a German mathematician, logician,
and philosopher who worked at the University of Jena. Frege
essentially recreated the discipline of logic by constructing the
first `predicate calculus'. In this calculus, Frege developed a new
analysis of atomic and quantified statements and formalized the notion
of a `proof' in terms that are still accepted today. Frege then
demonstrated that one could use this calculus to resolve theoretical
mathematical statements in terms of simpler logical and mathematical
notions. One of the axioms that Frege later adopted for his system,
in the attempt to derive significant parts of mathematics from logic,
proved to be inconsistent. Nevertheless, his definitions (of the
predecessor relation and of the concept of natural
number) and methods (for deriving the axioms of number theory)
were insightful and constituted a significant advance. To ground his
views about the relationship of logic and mathematics, Frege conceived
a comprehensive philosophy of language that many philosophers still
find insightful. However, his lifelong project, of showing that
mathematics was reducible to logic, was not successful.
- 1848, born November 8 in Wismar (Mecklenburg-Schwerin)
- 1869, entered the University of Jena
- 1871, entered the University of Göttingen
- 1873, awarded Ph. D. in Mathematics (Geometry), University
of Göttingen
- 1874, earned a Habilitation in Mathematics, University of Jena
- 1874, became Privatdozent, University of Jena
- 1879, became Professor Extraordinarius, University of Jena
- 1896, became ordentlicher Honorarprofessor, University of Jena
- 1917, retired from the University of Jena
- 1925, died July 26 in Bad Kleinen (now in Mecklenburg-Vorpommern)
Frege virtually founded the modern discipline of mathematical logic.
He forever changed the way philosophers and mathematical logicians
think about the predicate calculus, the analysis of simple sentences
and quantifier phrases, proofs, the foundations of mathematics,
definitions, and the `natural numbers'.
In an attempt to realize Leibniz's ideas for a language of thought
and a rational calculus, Frege developed a formal notation for
regimenting thought and reasoning (see his Begriffsschrift ).
Though we no longer use his notation, Frege's in effect developed the
first predicate calculus. A predicate calculus is a formal system
with two components: a formal language and a logic. The formal
language Frege designed was capable of: (a) expressing predicational
statements of the form `x falls under the concept F' and
`x bears relation R to y', etc., (b) expressing
complex statements such as `it is not the case that ...' and `if
... then ...', and (c) expressing `quantified' statements of the form
`Some x is such that ...x...' and `Every x is
such that ...x...'. The logic of Frege's calculus was a set of
rules that govern when some statements of the language may be
correctly inferred from others.
Frege's system was powerful enough to resolve the essential logic of
mathematical reasoning. That was partly due to the fact that his
predicate calculus was a `second-order' predicate calculus,
allowing statements of the form `Some concept F is such that
...F...' and `Every concept F is such that
...F...'. However, the most important insight underlying
Frege's calculus was his `function-argument' analysis of sentences.
This freed him from the limitations of the `subject-predicate'
analysis of sentences that formed the basis of Aristotelian logic and
it made it possible for him him to develop a general treatment of
quantification.
In traditional Aristotelian logic, the subject of a sentence and the
direct object of a verb are not on a logical par. The rules governing
the inferences between statements with different but related subject
terms are different from the rules governing the inferences between
statements with different but related verb complements. For example,
in Aristotelian logic, the rule which permits the valid inference from
`John loves Mary' to `Something loves Mary' is different from the rule
which permits the valid inference from `John loves Mary' to `John
loves something'. The rule governing the first inference is a rule
which applies only to the subject terms `John' and `Something'. The
rule governing the second inference applies only to the transitive
verb complements `Mary' and `something'. In Aristotelian logic, these
inferences have nothing in common.
In Frege's logic, a single rule governs both the inference from
`John loves Mary' to `Something loves Mary' and the inference from
`John loves Mary' to `John loves something'. This was made possible
by Frege's analysis of atomic and quantified sentences. Frege took
intransitive verb phrases such as `is happy' to be functions of one
variable (`x is happy'), and resolved the sentence "John is
happy" in terms of the application of the function denoted by `is
happy' to the argument denoted by `John'. In addition, Frege took the
verb phrase `loves' to be a function of two variables (`x loves
y') and resolved the sentence `John loves Mary' as the
application of the function denoted by `x loves y' to
the objects denoted by `John' and `Mary' respectively. In effect,
Frege saw no distinction between the subject `John' and the direct
object `Mary'. What is logically important is that `loves' denotes a
function of 2 arguments, that `gives' denotes a function of 3
arguments (x gives y to z), that `bought' denotes
a function of 4 arguments (x bought y from z for
amount u), etc.
This analysis allowed Frege to develop a more systematic treatment of
quantification than that offered by Aristotelian logic. No matter
whether the quantified expression `something' appears within a subject
("Something loves Mary") or within a predicate ("John loves
something"), it is to be resolved in the same way. In effect, Frege
treated quantified expressions as variable-binding operators. The
variable-binding operator `some x is such that' can bind the
variable `x' in the expression `x loves Mary' as well as
the variable `x' in the expression `John loves x'.
Thus, Frege analyzed the above inferences in the following general
way:
- John loves Mary. Therefore, some x is such that x loves Mary.
- John loves Mary. Therefore, some x is such that John loves x.
Both inferences are instances of a single valid inference rule.
As part of his predicate calculus, Frege developed a strict definition
of a `proof'. In essence, he defined a proof to be any finite
sequence of well-formed statements such that each statement in the
sequence either is an axiom or follows from previous members by a
valid rule of inference. A proof of the statement B from the premises
A1,...,An is any finite sequence of statements
(with B the final statement in the sequence) such that each member of
the sequence: (a) is one of the premises
A1,...,An, or (b) is an axiom, or (c) follows
from previous members of the sequence by a rule of inference. This is
essentially the definition of a proof that logicians still use today.
Frege was extremely careful about the proper description and
definition of logical and mathematical concepts. He developed
powerful and insightful criticisms of mathematical work which did not
meet his standards for clarity. For example, he criticized
mathematicians who defined a variable to be a number that varies
rather than an expression of language which can vary as to which
determinate number it refers to. And he criticized those
mathematicians who developed `piecemeal' definitions or `creative'
definitions. In the Grundgesetze (Band II, Sections 56-67)
Frege criticized the practice of defining a concept on a given range
of objects and later redefining the concept on a wider, more inclusive
range of concepts. Frequently, this `piecemeal' style of definition
led to conflict, since the redefined concept did not always reduce to
the original concept when one restricts the range to the original
class of objects. In that same work (Band II, Sections 139-147),
Frege criticised the mathematical practise of introducing notation to
name (unique) entities without first proving that there exist (unique)
such entities. He pointed out that such `creative definitions' were
simply unjustified.
Frege attempted to construct a foundation for mathematics. His most
comprehensive logical system was developed in his landmark work
Grundgesetze der Arithmetik, in which he attempted to
validate the philosophical doctrine known as logicism, i.e.,
the idea that mathematical concepts can be defined in terms of purely
logical concepts and that mathematical axioms can be derived from the
laws of logic alone. Unfortunately, Frege employed a principle in the
Grundgesetze (Basic Law V) which turned out to be subject to Russell's Paradox. This paradox caused
him to question the truth of logicism, and few philosophers today
believe that mathematics can be reduced to logic. Mathematics seems
to require some non-logical notions (such set membership) and some
non-logical axioms (such as the non-logical axioms of set
theory). Despite the fact that a contradiction invalidated a part of
his system, the intricate theoretical web of definitions and proofs
developed in the Grundgesetze produced a conceptual framework
for mathematical logic that was nothing short of revolutionary. There
is no doubt that the logical system and maze of definitions developed
by Bertrand Russell and Alfred North
Whitehead in Principia
Mathematica owe a huge debt to the work found in Frege's
Grundgesetze.
In his seminal work Die Grundlagen der Arithmetik, Frege
successfully defined the notion of a `cardinal number' in terms of the
primitive notion of an extension or set. The insight
behind the definition is that a statement of cardinal number such as
`There are n F-things' predicates a higher-order concept
of the concept F, namely, that it is a concept under which
n things fall. Frege simply defines the (cardinal) number of
the concept F (i.e., the number of Fs) as the extension
of the concept being a concept equinumerous to F. On this
definition, the number of planets is identified as the extension of
the concept being a concept equinumerous to the concept of being a
planet. In other words, the number of planets is an extension (or
set) which contains all those concepts which, like the concept
being a planet, are exemplified by nine objects.
Frege defined the concept of natural number by defining, for
every relation xRy, the general concept `x is an
ancestor of y in the R-series' (this new relation is called
`the ancestral of the relation R'). The ancestral of a relation R was
first defined in Frege's Begriffsschrift. The intuitive idea
is easily grasped if we consider the relation x is the father
of y. Suppose that a is the father of b, that
b is the father of c, and that c is the father of
d. Then Frege's definition of `x is an ancestor of
y in the fatherhood-series' ensured that a is an
ancestor of b, c, and d, that b is an
ancestor of c and d, and that c is an ancestor
of d.
More generally, if given a series of facts of the form aRb,
bRc, cRd, and so on, Frege showed how to define the
relation x is an ancestor of y in the R-series (this is the
ancestral of the relation R). To exploit this definition in the case
of natural numbers, Frege had to define both the relation x
precedes y and the ancestral of this relation, namely, x is an
ancestor of y in the predecessor-series. He first defined the
relational concept x precedes y as follows:
x precedes y iff there is a concept F and an object
z such that:
- z falls under F,
- y is the (cardinal) number of the concept F, and
- x is the (cardinal) number of the concept object other
than z falling under F
In the notation of the second-order predicate calculus, Frege's
definition becomes:
To see the intuitive idea behind this definition, consider how the
definition is satisfied in the case of the number 1 preceding the
number 2: there is a concept F (e.g., let F = the
concept being an author of Principia Mathematica) and an object
z (e.g. let z = Alfred North Whitehead) such that:
- Whitehead falls under the concept being an author of Principian
Mathematica,
- 2 is the (cardinal) number of the concept being an author of
Principia Mathematica, and
- 1 is the (cardinal) number of the concept object other
than Whitehead which falls under the concept being an author of
Principia Mathematica
Note that the last conjunct is true because there is exactly 1 object
(namely, Bertrand Russell) which falls under the concept object
other than Whitehead which falls under the concept being an author of
Principia Mathematica.
Given this definition of precedes, Frege then defined the
ancestral of this relation, namely, x is an ancestor of y in the
predecessor-series. So, for example, if 10 precedes 11 and 11
precedes 12, it follows that 10 is an ancestor of 12 in the
predecessor-series. Note, however, that although 10 is an ancestor of
12, 10 does not precede 12, for the notion of precedes is that
of strictly precedes. Note also that by defining the ancestral
of the precedence relation, Frege had in effect defined x <
y.
Frege then defined the number 0 as the (cardinal) number of the
concept being an object not identical with itself. The idea
here is that nothing fails to be self-identical, so nothing falls
under this concept. The number 0 is therefore identified with the
extension of all concepts which fail to be exemplified.
Finally, Frege defined:
x is a natural number iff either x = 0 or 0 is an ancestor of
x in the predecessor series
In other words, a natural number is any member of the predecessor
series beginning with 0.
Using this definition, Frege derived many important theorems of number
theory. It was recently shown by R. Heck [1993] that, despite the
logical inconsistency in the system of his Grundgesetze, Frege
validly derived the Dedekind/Peano Axioms for number theory from a
powerful and consistent principle now known as Hume's Principle ("The
number of Fs is equal to the number of Gs if and only if there is a
one-to-one correspondence between the Fs and the Gs"). Although Frege
used his inconsistent axiom Basic Law V to establish Hume's Principle,
once Hume's Principle was established, Frege validly derived the
Dedekind/Peano axioms without making any further essential appeals to
Basic Law V. Following the lead of George Boolos, philosophers today
call derivation of the Dedekind/Peano Axioms from Hume's Principle
`Frege's Theorem'. The proof of Frege's Theorem was a tour de force
which involved some of the most beautiful, subtle, and complex logical
reasoning that had ever been devised. For a comprehensive introduction to the logic of Frege's Theorem, see the entry
Frege's logic, theorem, and foundations for arithmetic.
While pursuing his investigations into mathematics and logic (and
quite possibly, in order to ground those investigations), Frege was
led to develop not only an ontology of functions and
objects but also a philosophy of language. In his ontology,
Frege asserted the existence of two special objects, namely, the truth
values The True and The False and defined concepts as a special
kind of function, namely, any function that mapped objects to truth
values. He also suggested that existence is not a property of
objects but rather of concepts. Frege is most well-known among
philosophers, however, for the way these ideas were applied and
extended in his philosophy of language. His seminal paper in this
field `Über Sinn und Bedeutung' (`On Sense and Denotation') is
now a classic. In this paper, Frege considered two puzzles about
language and noticed, in each case, that one cannot account for the
meaningfulness or logical behavior of certain sentences simply on the
basis of the denotations of the terms (names and descriptions) in the
sentence. One puzzle concerned identity statements and the other
concerned sentences with relative clauses such as propositional
attitude reports. To solve these puzzles, Frege suggested that the
terms of a language have both a sense and a denotation (i.e., that at
least two semantic relations are required to explain the significance
or meaning of the terms of a language). This idea has inspired
research in the field for over a century.
In Frege's ontology, functions and objects were rigorously
distinguished as two fundamentally different kinds of entity.
Functions are the kind of thing that take objects as arguments and map
those arguments to a value. Frege did not limit examples of functions
to mathematical functions such as x + 3. He allowed the
variable x to range over any object, and so father of x
is a genuine example of a function---it maps certain biological
offspring to their fathers and maps everything else to The False.
Frege associates with every function, a course-of-values. The
course-of-values of a function explicitly indicates the value of the
function for each object that is supplied as an argument. In
addition, Frege believed that there are two distinguished objects,
namely, the truth value The True and the truth-value The False. Those
functions which map objects to truth values are called
concepts. For example, not only is the mathematical function
x + 3 = 5 a concept (this concept maps the number 2 to The True
and everything else to The False), but so is the function x is
happy (which maps anything that is happy to The True and
everything else to The False). Frege defines the extension of
a concept to contain just those objects which the concept maps to The
True (as indicated by the course-of-values associated with the
concept).
Frege suggested that existence is not a property of objects but
rather of concepts: it is the property a concept has just in case it
has an non-empty extension (i.e., just in case it maps some object to
The True). So the fact that the extension of the concept
martian is empty underlies the ordinary claim "Martians don't
exist." Frege therefore took existence to be a `second-level'
concept.
Frege's Puzzle About Identity Statements. Here are some
examples of identity statements:
117 + 136 = 253.
The morning star is identical to the evening star.
Mark Twain is Samuel Clemens.
Bill is Debbie's father.
Frege believed that these statements all have the form "a = b
", where `a ' and `b ' are either names or descriptions
that denote individuals. He naturally assumed that a sentence
of the form "a = b " is true if and only if the object
denoted by `a ' is the same as the object denoted by `b
'. For example, "117 + 136 = 253" is true if and only if `117 + 236'
and `253' denote the same number. And "Mark Twain is Samuel Clemens"
is true if and only if `Mark Twain' and `Samuel Clemens' denote the
same person. So the truth of "a = b " requires that the
expressions flanking the identity sign denote the same object.
But Frege noticed that on this account of truth, the truth conditions
for "a = b " are no different from the truth conditions for
"a = a ". For example, the truth conditions for "Mark Twain =
Mark Twain" are the same as those for "Mark Twain = Samuel Clemens";
not only do the names flanking the identity sign denote the same
object in each case, but the object is the same between the two cases.
The problem is that the cognitive significance (or meaning) of the two
sentences differ. We can learn that "Mark Twain = Mark Twain" is true
simply by inspecting it; but we can't learn the truth of "Mark Twain =
Samuel Clemens" simply by inspecting it. Similarly, whereas you can
learn that "117 + 136 = 117 + 136" and "the morning star is identical
to the morning star" are true simply by inspection, you can't learn
the truth of "117 + 136 = 253" and "the morning star is identical to
the evening star" simply by inspection. In the latter cases, you have
to do some arithmetical work or astronomical investigation to learn
the truth of these identity claims.
So the puzzle Frege discovered is: if we cannot appeal to a difference
in denotation of the terms flanking the identity sign, how do we
explain the difference in cognitive significance between "a = b
" and "a = a "?
Frege's Puzzle About Propositional Attitude Reports.
Frege is generally credited with identifying the following puzzle
about propositional attitude reports, even though he didn't quite
describe the puzzle in the terms used below. A propositional attitude
is a psychological relation between a person and a proposition.
Belief, desire, intention, discovery, knowledge, etc., are all
psychological relationships between persons, on the one hand, and
propositions, on the other. When we report the propositional
attitudes of others, these reports all have a similar logical form:
x believes that p
x desires that p
x intends that p
x discovered that p
x knows that p
If we replace the variable `x ' by the name of a person and
replace the variable `p ' with a sentence that describes the
propositional object of their attitude, we get specific attitude
reports. So by replacing `x ' by `John' and `p ' by
"Mark Twain wrote Huckleberry Finn " in the first example, the
result would be the following specific belief report:
John believes that Mark Twain wrote Huckleberry Finn.
To see the problem posed by the analysis of propositional attitude
reports, consider what appears to be a simple principle of reasoning,
namely, the Principle of Substitution. If a name, say n,
appears in a true sentence S, and the identity sentence n=m
is true, then the Principle of Substitution tells us that the
substitution of the name m for the name n in S does
not affect the truth of S. For example, let S be the true sentence
"Mark Twain was an author", let n be the name `Mark Twain',
and let m be the name `Samuel Clemens'. Then since the
identity sentence "Mark Twain = Samuel Clemens" is true, we can
substitute `Samuel Clemens' for `Mark Twain' without affecting the
truth of the sentence. And indeed, the resulting sentence "Samuel
Clemens was an author" is true. In other words, the following
argument is valid:
Mark Twain was an author.
Mark Twain = Samuel Clemens.
Therefore, Samuel Clemens was an author.
Similarly, the following argument is valid.
4 > 3
4 = 8/2
Therefore, 8/2 > 3
In general, then, the Principle of Substitution seems to take the
following form, where S is a sentence, n and m are
names, and S(n ) differs from S(m ) only by the fact that
at least one occurrence of m replaces n:
From S(n ) and n = m , infer S(m )
This principle seems to capture the idea that if we say
something true about an object, then even if we change the name by
which we refer to that object, we should still be saying something
true about that object.
But Frege, in effect, noticed the following counterexample to the
Principle of Substitution. Consider the following argument:
John believes that Mark Twain wrote Huckleberry Finn .
Mark Twain = Samuel Clemens.
Therefore, John believes that Samuel Clemens wrote Huckleberry
Finn .
This argument is not valid. There are circumstances in which the
premises are true and the conclusion false. We have already described
such circumstances, namely, one in which John learns the name `Mark
Twain' by reading Huckleberry Finn but learns the name `Samuel
Clemens' in the context of learning about 19th century American
authors (without learning that the name `Mark Twain' was a pseudonym
for Samuel Clemens). John may not believe that Samuel Clemens
wrote Huckleberry Finn. The premises of the above argument,
therefore, do not logically entail the conclusion. So the Principle
of Substitution appears to break down in the context of propositional
attitude reports. The puzzle, then, is to say what causes the
principle to fail in these contexts. Why aren't we still saying
something true about the man in question if all we have done is
changed the name by which we refer to him?
.
To explain these puzzles, Frege suggested that in addition to having a
denotation, names and descriptions also express a sense. The
sense of a expression accounts for its cognitive significance---it is
the way by which one conceives of the denotation of the term. The
expressions `4' and `8/2' have the same denotation but express
different senses, different ways of conceiving the same number. The
descriptions `the morning star' and `the evening star' denote the same
planet, namely Venus, but express different ways of conceiving of
Venus and so have different senses. The name `Pegasus' and the
description `the most powerful Greek god' both have a sense (and their
senses are distinct), but neither has a denotation. However, even
though the names `Mark Twain' and `Samuel Clemens' denote the same
individual, they express different senses. Using the distinction
between sense and denotation, Frege can account for the difference in
cognitive significance between identity statements of the form "a =
a" and "a = b". The sense of the whole statement, on
Frege's view, is a function of the senses of its component parts.
Since the sense of `a' differs from the sense of `b',
the components of "a = a" and "a = b" are different and
so the sense of the whole expression will be different in the two
cases. Since the sense of an expression accounts for its cognitive
significance, Frege has an explanation of the difference in cognitive
significance between "a = a" and "a = b", and thus a
solution to the first puzzle.
Moreover, Frege proposed that when a term (name or description)
follows a propositional attitude verb, it no longer denotes what it
ordinarily denotes. Instead, Frege claims that in such contexts, a
term denotes its ordinary sense. This explains why the Principle of
Substitution fails for terms following the propositional attitude
verbs in propositional attitude reports. The Principle asserts that
truth is preserved when we substitute one name for another having the
same denotation. But, according to Frege's theory, the names `Mark
Twain' and `Samuel Clemens' denote different senses when they occur in
the following sentences:
John believes that Mark Twain wrote Huckleberry Finn.
John believes that Samuel Clemens wrote Huckleberry Finn.
If they don't denote the same object, then there is
no reason to think that substitution of one name for another would
preserve truth.
Frege developed the theory of sense and denotation into a
thoroughgoing philosophy of language. This philosophy can be
explained, at least in outline, by considering a simple sentence such
as "John loves Mary". In Frege's view, each word in this sentence is
a name and, moreover, the sentence as a whole is a complex name. Each
of these names has both a sense and a denotation. Then sense and
denotation of the words are basic; but sense and denotation of the
sentence as a whole can be described in terms of the sense and
denotation of the words and the way in which those words are arranged
in the sentence. Let us refer to the denotation and sense of the
words as follows:
d[j] refers to the denotation of the name `John'.
d[m] refers to the denotation of the name `Mary'.
d[L] refers to the denotation of the name `loves'.
s[j] refers to the sense of the name `John'.
s[m] refers to the sense of the name `Mary'.
s[L] refers to the sense of the name `loves'.
We now work toward a theoretical description of the denotation of the
sentence as a whole. On Frege's view, d[j] and d[m] are
the real individuals John and Mary, respectively. d[L] is a
function that maps d[m] (i.e., Mary) to a function which serves
as the denotation of the predicate `loves Mary'. Let us refer to that
function as d[Lm]. Now the function d[Lm] maps
d[j] (i.e., John) to the denotation of the sentence "John loves
Mary". Let us refer to the denotation of the sentence as
d[jLm]. Frege identifies the denotation of a sentence as one
of the two truth values. Because d[Lm] maps objects to truth
values, it is a concept. Thus, d[jLm] is the truth value The
True if the extension of the concept d[Lm] contains John;
otherwise it is the truth value The False. So, on Frege's view, the
sentence "John loves Mary" names a truth value.
The sentence "John loves Mary" also expresses a sense. Its sense may
be described as follows. First, s[L] (the sense of the name
"loves") is identified as a function. This function maps s[m]
(the sense of the name "Mary") to the sense of the predicate `loves
Mary'. Let us refer to the sense of `loves Mary' as s[Lm].
Now the function s[Lm] maps s[j] (the sense of the name
`John') to the sense of the whole sentence. Let us call the sense of
the entire sentence s[jLm]. Frege calls the sense of a
sentence a thought, and whereas there are only two truth
values, he supposes that there are an infinite number of thoughts.
On Frege's view, therefore, the sentences "4 = 8/2" and "4 = 4" both
name the same truth value, but they express different thoughts. That
is because s[4] is different from s[8/2]. Similarly,
"Mark Twain = Mark Twain" and "Mark Twain = Samuel Clemens" denote the
same truth value, but express different thoughts (since the sense of
the names differ). Thus, Frege has a general account of the
difference in the cognitive significance between identity statements
of the form "a = a" and "a = b".
Furthermore, recall that Frege proposed that terms following
propositional attitude verbs denote not their ordinary denotations but
rather the senses they ordinarily express. In fact, in the following
propositional attitude report, not only do the words `Mark Twain',
`wrote' and `Huckleberry Finn ' denote their ordinary senses,
but the entire sentence "Mark Twain wrote Huckleberry Finn"
also denotes its ordinary sense (namely, a thought):
John believes that Mark Twain wrote Huckleberry Finn.
Frege, therefore, would analyze this attitude report as follows:
"believes that" denotes a function that maps the denotation of the
sentence "Mark Twain wrote Huckleberry Finn" to a concept. In
this case, however, the denotation of the sentence "Mark Twain wrote
Huckleberry Finn" is not a truth value but rather a thought.
The thought it denotes is different from the thought denoted by
"Samuel Clemens wrote Huckleberry Finn" in the following
propositional attitude report:
John believes that Samuel Clemens wrote Huckleberry Finn.
Since the thought denoted by "Samuel Clemens wrote
Huckleberry Finn" in this context differs from the thought
denoted by "Mark Twain wrote Huckleberry Finn" in the same
context, the concept denoted by `believes that Mark Twain wrote
Huckleberry Finn' is a different concept from the one denoted
by `believes that Samuel Clemens wrote Huckleberry Finn'. One
may consistently suppose that the concept denoted by the former
predicate maps John to The True whereas the the concept denoted by the
latter predicate does not. Frege's analysis therefore preserves our
intuition that John can believe that Mark Twain wrote Huckleberry
Finn without believing that Samuel Clemens did. It also preserves
the Principle of Substitution---the fact that one cannot substitute
"Samuel Clemens" for "Mark Twain" when these names occur after
propositional attitude verbs does not constitute evidence against the
Principle. For if Frege is right, names do not have their usual
denotation when they occur in these contexts.
Frege's Main Writings
- Begriffsschrift, eine der arithmetischen nachgebildete
Formelsprache des reinen Denkens (`Concept Notation, a formal
language of pure thought, modelled upon that of arithmetic'), Halle
a. S., 1879
- Die Grundlagen der Arithmetik: eine logisch-mathematische
Untersuchung über den Begriff der Zahl (`The Foundations of
Arithmetic: A logico-mathematcial enquiry into the concept of
number'), Breslau, 1884
- Funktion und Begriff (`Function and Concept'): Vortrag,
gehalten in der Sitzung vom 9. Januar 1891 der Jenaischen Gesellschaft
für Medizin und Naturwissenschaft, Jena, 1891
- `Über Sinn und Bedeutung' (`On Sense and Denotation'), in
Zeitschrift für Philosophie und philosophische Kritik, C
(1892): 25-50
- `Über Begriff und Gegenstand' (`On Concept and Object'), in
Vierteljahresschrift für wissenschaftliche Philosophie,
XVI (1892): 192-205
- Grundgesetze der Arithmetik (`Basic Laws of
Arithmetic'), Jena: Verlag Hermann Pohle, Band I (1893), Band II
(1903)
- `Was ist eine Funktion?' (`What is a Function?'), in
Festschrift Ludwig Boltzmann gewidmet zum sechzigsten Geburtstage,
20. Februar 1904, S. Meyer (ed.), Leipzig, 1904, pp. 656-666
- `Der Gedanke. Eine logische Untersuchung' (`The Thought: A
Logical Enquiry'), in Beiträge zur Philosophie des deutschen
Idealismus I (1918): 58-77
Frege's Other Writings
- `Anwendungen der Begriffsschrift', Jenaische Zeitschrift
ür Naturwissenschaft XIII (1979), Supplement II,
pp. 29-33
- `Über die wissenschaftliche Berechtigung einer
Begriffsschrift' (`On the Scientific Justification of Concept
Notation'), Zeitschrift für Philosophie und philosophische
Kritik, LXXXI (1882): 48-56
- `Über den Zweck der Begriffsschrift' (`On the Purpose of
Concept Notation'), Jenaische Zeitschrift
für Naturwissenschaft, XVI (1883), Supplement,
pp. 1-10
- `Erwiderung', Deutsche Literaturzeitung, VI/28
(1885): column 1030 (a brief reply to Cantor's review of the
Grundlagen )
- `Über das Trägheitsgesetz' (`On the Law of Inertia'),
Zeitschrift für Philosophie und philosophische Kritik,
XCVIII (1891): 145-161
- Review of E. Husserl's Philosophie der Arithmetik,
Vol. I, in Zeitschrift für Philosophie und philosophische
Kritik, CIII (1894): 313-332
- `Kritische Beleuchtung einiger Punkte in E. Schröders
Vorlesungen über die Algebra der Logik, in Archiv
für systematische Philosophie, I (1895): 433-456
- Letter to the Editor, Rivista di Matematica, VI
(1896-9): 53-59
- `Über die Grundlagen der Geometrie', Jahresbericht der
Deutschen Mathematiker-Vereinigung XV (1903),
Part I pp. 293-309, Part II pp. 368-375
- Notes to P. E. B. Jourdain, `The Development of the Theories of
Mathematical Logic and the Principles of Mathematics: Gottlob
Frege', The Quarterly Journal of Pure and Applied
Mathematics XLIII (1912): 237-69
- `Der Gedanke. Eine Logische Untersuchung', Beiträge
zur Philosophie des deutschen Idealismus I (1918):
58-77
- `Die Verneinung. Eine Logische Untersuchung', Beiträge
zur Philosophie des deutschen Idealismus I (1918):
143-157
- `Logische Untersuchungen. Dritter Teil: Gedankengefüge',
Beiträge zur Philosophie des deutschen Idealismus
III (1923): 36-51
Translations of Frege's Writings into English
- The Frege Reader, M. Beaney (ed.), Oxford: Blackwell, 1997
- The Foundations of Arithmetic. A logic-mathematical enquiry
into the concept of number, trans. by J. L. Austin, Oxford:
Blackwell, second revised edition, 1974
- Translations from the Philosophical Writings of Gottlob
Frege, ed. and trans. by P. Geach and M. Black, Oxford: Blackwell,
second revised edition, 1970
- The Basic Laws of Arithmetic, (Exposition of the System:
Volume I), ed. and trans. by M. Furth, Berkeley: U. of California
Press, 1964 (this contains the introductory fragment from Volume I of
Frege's Grundgesetze. and the Appendix to Volume II)
- `The Thought: A Logical Enquiry', trans. by A. and M. Quinton,
Mind, LXV (1956): 289-311
- `Compound Thoughts', trans. by R. Stoothoff, Mind
LXXII (1963): 1-17
- The Foundations of Geometry, trans. by M. E. Szabo, The
Philosophical Review, LXIX (1960), pp. 3-17
- `About the Law of Inertia', trans. by R. Rand,
Synthese, X11 (1961): 350-363
- `On the Scientific Justification of a Concept-script', trans. by
J. M. Bartlett, Mind, LXXIII (1964), pp. 155-60
- `Begriffsschrift, a formula language, modelled upon that of
arithmetic, for pure thought', trans. by S. Bauer-Mengelberg, in
J. van Heijenoort (ed.), From Frege to Gödel, a source book in
mathematical logic, 1879-1931, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University
Press, 1967
- `On the Purpose of the Begriffsschrift', trans. by
V. H. Dudman, The Australasian Journal of Philosophy,
XLVI (1968), pp. 89-97
- Conceptual Notaton and Related Articles, trans. and
ed. by Terrell Ward Bynum, Oxford: Clarendon, 1972
- On Foundatons of Geometry and Formal Theories of
Arthmetic, trans. E.-H. W. Kluge, New Haven: Yale University
Press, 1971.
- Posthumous Writings, ed. by H. Hermes, F. Kambartel,
and F. Kaulbach, trans. by P. Long and R. White, Chicago: U. of
Chicago Press, 1979
- Philosophical and Mathematical Correspondence, ed. by
G. Gabriel, H. Hermes, F. Kambartel, C. Thiel, and A. Veraart,
trans. by H. Kaal, Chicago: U. of Chicago Press, 1980
- Collected Papers on Mathematics, Logic, and Philosophy,
ed. by B. McGuinness, trans. by Black, Dudman, Geach, Kaal, Kluge,
McGuinness, and Stoothoff, Oxford: Basil Blackwell, 1984
- `On Herr Peano's Begriffsschrift and My Own',
Australasian Journal of Philosophy, 47 (1969): 1--14
- Boolos, G., 1986, "Saving Frege From Contradiction", Proceedings of
the Aristotelian Society, 87 (1986/87): 137-151
- Boolos, G., 1987, "The Consistency of Frege's Foundations of
Arithmetic", in J. Thomson (ed.), On Being and Saying,
Cambridge, MA: The MIT Press, pp. 3-20
- Currie, G., 1982, Frege: An Introduction to His Philosophy,
Brighton, Sussex: Harvester Press
- Demopoulos, W., (ed.), 1995, Frege's Philosophy of Mathematics,
Cambridge, MA: Harvard
- Dummett, M., 1973, Frege: Philosophy of Language, London:
Duckworth
- Dummett, M., 1991, Frege: Philosophy of Mathematics, Cambridge,
MA: Harvard University Press
- Heck, R., 1993, "The Development of Arithmetic in Frege's
Grundgesetze der Arithmetik", Journal of Symbolic
Logic, 58/2 (June): 579-601
- Klemke, E. D. (ed.), 1968, Essays on Frege, Urbana, IL:
University of Illinois Press
- Parsons, T., 1981, "Frege's Hierarchies of Indirect Senses and the
Paradox of Analysis", Midwest Studies in Philosophy: VI,
Minneapolis: University fo Minnesota Press, pp. 37-57
- Parsons, T., 1987, "On the Consistency of the First-Order Portion of
Frege's Logical System", Notre Dame Journal of Formal Logic
28/1 (January): 161-168
- Parsons, T., 1982, "Fregean Theories of Fictional Objects",
Topoi 1: 81-87
- Resnik, M., 1980, Frege and the Philosophy of Mathematics,
Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press
- Ricketts, T., 1997, "Truth-Values and Courses-of-Value in Frege's
Grundgesetze", in Early Analytic Philosophy, W. Tait
(ed.), Chicago: Open Court, pp. 187-211
- Salmon, N., 1986, Frege's Puzzle, Cambridge, MA: MIT Press
- Schirn, M., (ed.), 1996, Frege: Importance and Legacy, Berlin:
de Gruyter
- Sluga, H., 1980, Gottlob Frege, London: Routledge and Kegan
Paul
- Wright, C., 1983, Frege's Conception of Numbers as Objects,
Aberdeen: Aberdeen University Press
denotation |
Frege's logic, theorem, and foundations for arithmetic |
logic: intensional |
logicism |
mathematics, philosophy of |
predicate calculus |
quantification |
Principia Mathematica |
Russell, Bertrand |
Russell's Paradox |
sense
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Edward N. Zalta
zalta@mally.stanford.edu
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First published: September 14, 1995
Content last modified: July 13, 1999