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Thought Experiments
Thought experiments are devices of the imagination used to investigate
nature. We need only list a few of the well-known thought experiments
to be reminded of their enormous influence and importance in the
sciences: Newton's bucket, Maxwell's demon, Einstein's elevator,
Heisenberg's gamma-ray microscope, Schrödinger's cat. The 17th
century saw some of its most brilliant practitioners in Galileo,
Descartes, Newton, and Leibniz. And in our own time, the creation of
quantum mechanics and relativity are almost unthinkable without the
crucial role played by thought experiments. Galileo and Einstein were,
arguably, the most impressive thought experimenters, but they were by
no means the first. Thought experiments existed throughout the middle
ages, and can be found in antiquity, too.
One of the most beautiful early examples (Lucretius, De Rerum
Natura) attempts to show that space is infinite: If there is a
boundary to the universe, we can toss a spear at it. If the spear
flies through, it isn't a boundary after all; if the spear bounces
back, then there must be something beyond the supposed edge of space,
a cosmic wall which is itself in space that stopped the spear. Either
way, there is no edge of the universe; space is infinite. This
example nicely illustrates many of the common features of thought
experiments: We visualize some situation; we carry out an operation;
we see what happens. It also illustrates their fallibility. (In this
case we've learned how to conceptualize space so that it is both
finite and unbounded.)
Often a real experiment that is the analogue of a thought experiment
is impossible for physical, technological, or just plain practical
reasons; but this needn't be a defining condition of thought
experiments. The main point is that we seem able to get a grip on
nature just by thinking, and therein lies the great interest for
philosophy. How is it possible to learn (apparently) new things about
nature without new empirical data?
Ernst Mach (who seems to have coined the expression
Gedankenexperiment) developed an interesting empiricist view
in his classic, The Science of Mechanics. We possess, he
says, a great store of "instinctive knowledge" picked up from
experience. This needn't be articulated at all, but comes to the fore
when we consider certain situations. One of his favourite examples is
due to Simon Stevin. When a chain is draped over a double
frictionless plane, as in Fig. 1a, how will it move? Add some links
as in Fig. 1b.
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Figure 1a |
Figure 1b |
Now it is obvious. The initial setup must have been in static
equilibrium. Otherwise, we would have a perpetual motion machine; and
according to our experience-based "instinctive knowledge", says Mach,
this is impossible.
Thomas Kuhn's "A Function for Thought Experiments" employs many of the
concepts (but not the terminology) of his well-known Structure of
Scientific Revolutions. On his view a well-conceived thought
experiment can bring on a crisis or at least create an anomaly in the
reigning theory and so contribute to paradigm change. So thought
experiments can teach us something new about the world, even though we
have no new data, by helping us to reconceptualize the world in a
better way.
Recent years have seen a sudden growth of interest in thought
experiments. The views of Brown (1991) and Norton (1991, 1996)
represent the extremes of platonic rationalism and classic empiricism,
respectively. Norton claims that any thought experiment is really a
(possibly disguised) argument; it starts with premisses grounded in
experience and follows deductive or inductive rules of inference in
arriving at its conclusion. The picturesque features of any thought
experiment which give it an experimental flavour might be
psychologically helpful, but are strictly redundant. Thus, says
Norton, we never go beyond the empirical premisses in a way to which
any empiricist would object. (For criticisms see Brown (1991, 1993)
and for a defense see Norton (1996).)
By contrast, Brown holds that in a few special cases we do go well
beyond the old data to acquire a priori knowledge of nature.
Galileo showed that all bodies fall at the same speed with a brilliant
thought experiment that started by destroying the then reigning
Aristotelian account. The latter holds that heavy bodies fall faster
than light ones (H > L). But consider (Fig. 2), in which a heavy
canon ball (H) and light musket ball (L) are attached together to form
a compound object (H+L); the latter must fall faster than the cannon
ball alone. Yet the compound object must also fall slower, since the
light part will act as a drag on the heavy part. Now we have a
contradiction. (H+L > H and H > H+L) That's the end of Aristotle's
theory; but there is a bonus, since the right account is now obvious:
they all fall at the same speed (H = L = H+L).
Figure 2
This is said to be a priori (though still fallible)
knowledge of nature since there are no new data involved, nor is the
conclusion derived from old data, nor is it some sort of logical
truth. This account of thought experiments is further developed by
linking the a priori epistemology to a recent account of laws of
nature which holds that laws are relations between objectively
existing abstract entities. It is thus a rather platonistic view, not
unlike platonistic accounts of mathematics such as that urged by
Gödel. (For details see Brown 1991.)
The two views just sketched might occupy the opposite ends of a
spectrum of positions on thought experiments. Some of the promising
new alternative views include those of Sorensen (somewhat in the
spirit of Mach) who holds that thought experiments are a "limiting
case" of ordinary experiments; they can achieve their aim, he says,
without being executed. (Sorensen's book is also valuable for its
extensive discussion of thought experiments in philosophy of mind,
ethics, and other areas of philosophy, as well as the sciences.)
Other promising views include those of Gooding (who stresses the
similar procedural nature of thought experiments and real
experiments), Miscevic and Nersessian (each of whom tie thought
experiments to "mental models"), and several of the accounts in
Horowitz and Massey (1991). More recent excellent discussions
include: Arthur (1999), Gendler (1998), Haggqvist (1996), Humphreys
(1994), Genz (1999), McAllister (1996). The literature on thought
experiments continues to grow rapidly.
- Arthur, R. (1999) "On Thought Experiments as A Priori Science,"
International Studies in the Philosophy of Science, 13, 3,
215-229
- Brown, J.R. (1991) Laboratory of the Mind: Thought Experiments
in the Natural Sciences, London: Routledge
- Brown, J.R. (1993) "Why Empiricism Won't Work", in D. Hull,
M. Forbes, and K. Okruhlik (eds.) PSA 1992, vol. 2, East
Lansing, MI: Philosophy of Science Association
- Gendler, T.S.(1998) "Galileo and the Indispensibility of
Scientific Thought Experiment", The British Journal for the
Philosophy of Science, Vol.49, No.3, (September), 397-424
- Genz, H. (1999) Gedanken-experimente, Wiley-VCH, Weinheim,
(in German)
- Gooding, D. (1993) "What is Experimental About Thought
Experiments?" in D. Hull, M. Forbes, and K. Okruhlik (eds.) PSA
1992, vol. 2, East Lansing, MI: Philosophy of Science Association
- Hacking, I. (1993) "Do Thought Experiments have a Life of Their
Own?" in D. Hull, M. Forbes, and K. Okruhlik (eds.) PSA 1992,
vol. 2, East Lansing, MI: Philosophy of Science Association
- Haggqvist, S. (1996) Thought Experiments in Philosophy,
(Stockholm: Almqvist & Wiksell International)
- Horowitz, T. and G. Massey (eds.) (1991) Thought Experiments in
Science and Philosophy, Savage MD: Rowman and Littlefield
- Humphries, P. (1994) "Seven Theses on Thought Experiments", in
Earman et al., (eds) Philosophical Problems of the
Internal and External World, Pittsburgh: University of Pittsburgh
Press
- Kuhn, T. (1964) "A Function for Thought Experiments", reprinted in
Kuhn, The Essential Tension, Chicago: University of Chicago
Press, 1977
- Mach, E. (1960) The Science of Mechanics, (Trans by
J. McCormack), sixth edition, LaSalle Illinois: Open Court
- Mach, E. (1976) "On Thought Experiments", in Knowledge and
Error, Dordrecht: Reidel
- McAllister, J. (1996) "The Evidential Significance of Thought
Experiments in Science", Studies in History and Philosophy of
Science, vol 27, no. 2, 233-250
- Miscevic , N. (1992) "Mental Models and Thought Experiments",
International Studies in the Philosophy of Science, Vol. 6,
No. 3, pp. 215-226
- Nersessian, N. (1993) "In the Theoretician's Laboratory:
Thought Experimenting as Mental Modeling" in D. Hull, M. Forbes, and
K. Okruhlik (eds.) PSA 1992, vol. 2, East Lansing, MI:
Philosophy of Science Association
- Norton, J. (1991) "Thought Experiments in Einstein's Work", in
Horowitz and Massey (1991)
- Norton, J. (1996) "Are Thought Experiments Just What You Always
Thought?" Canadian Journal of Philosophy
- Sorensen, R. (1992) Thought Experiments, Oxford: Oxford
University Press
[Please contact the author with suggestions.]
Descartes, René |
Leibniz, Gottfried Wilhelm |
Mach, Ernst |
science, philosophy of
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Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy