Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
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Folk Psychology as Mental Simulation
The simulation (or, "mental simulation") theory, introduced
in 1986 by Robert Gordon and Jane Heal and further developed by
Alvin Goldman, Paul Harris, and others, maintains that human beings
are able to use the resources of their own minds to simulate the
psychological etiology of the behavior of others, typically by
making decisions within a "pretend" context. The theory
is usually, though not always, taken to present a serious challenge
to the assumption that a theory underlies everyday human
competence in predicting and explaining behavior, including the
capacity to ascribe mental states. Unlike earlier controversies
concerning the role of empathetic understanding and historical
reenactment in the human sciences, the current debate between
the simulation theory and the "theory" theory appeals
to empirical findings, particularly experimental results concerning
children's development of psychological competence, as detailed
below.
According to the simulation theory, human beings are able to use
the resources of their own minds to simulate the psychological
etiology of the behavior of others, typically by making decisions
within a "pretend" context. A common method is role-taking,
or "putting oneself in the other's place." However,
like the term `theory,' `simulation' has come to be used broadly
and in a variety of ways. The term is often taken to cover reliance
on a shared world of facts and emotive and motivational charges,
where there is no need to put oneself in the other's place. (Gordon
calls this the default mode of simulation.) Sometimes the term
is taken to include automatic responses such as the subliminal
mimicry of facial expressions and bodily movements. Stephen Stich
and Shaun Nichols, whose critical papers have clarified the issues
and helped refine the theory, urge that the term be dropped in
favor of a finer-grained terminology.
Simulation is often conceived in cognitive-scientific terms: one's
own behavior control system is employed as a manipulable model
of other such systems. The system is first taken off-line, so
that the output is not actual behavior but only predictions or
anticipations of behavior, and inputs and system parameters are
accordingly not limited to those that would regulate one's own
behavior. Many proponents hold that, because one human behavior
control system is being used to model others, general information
about such systems is unnecessary. The simulation is thus said
to be process-driven rather than theory-driven (Goldman).
Important differences exist among simulation theorists on several
topics. According to Goldman and (less clearly) Harris, to ascribe
mental states to others by simulation, one must already be able
to ascribe mental states to oneself, and thus must already possess
the relevant mental state concepts. Gordon holds a contrary view
suggested by both Kant and Quine: Only those who can simulate
can understand an ascription of, e.g., belief--that to S
it is the case that p. While no simulation theorist claims that
all our everyday explanations and predictions of the actions of
other people are based on role-taking, Heal in particular has
been a moderating influence, arguing for a hybrid simulation-and-theory
account that reserves simulation primarily for items with rationally
linked content, such as beliefs, desires, and actions.
Three main areas of empirical investigation have been thought
especially relevant to the debate:
- False belief. Taking into account another's
ignorance or false belief when predicting or explaining their behavior
requires imaginative modifications of one's own beliefs, according to
the simulation theory. Thus the theory offers an explanation of the
results of numerous experiments showing that younger children fail to
take such factors into. It would also explain the correlation, in
autism, of failure to take into account ignorance or false belief and
failure to engage in spontaneous pretend-play, particularly role
play. Although these results can also be explained by certain versions
of theory theory (and were so interpreted by the experimenters
themselves), the simulation theory offers a new interpretation.
- Priority of self- or other-ascription. A second area
of developmental research asks whether children ascribe mental states
to themselves before they ascribe them to others. Versions of the
simulation theory committed to the view that we recognize our own
mental states as such and make analogical inferences to others' mental
states seem to require an affirmative answer to this question; other
versions of the theory seem to require a negative answer. Some
experiments suggest a negative answer, but debate continues on this
question.
- Cognitive impenetrability. Stich and Nichols suppose
simulation to be "cognitively impenetrable" in that it
operates independently of any general knowledge the simulator may have
about human psychology. Yet they point to results suggesting that when
subjects lack certain psychological information, they sometimes make
incorrect predictions, and therefore must not be simulating. Because
of problems of methodology and interpretation, as noted by a number of
philosophers and psychologists, the cogency of this line of criticism
is unclear.
The numerous other empirical questions of possible relevance to
the debate include the following:
Does brain imaging reveal that systems and processes employed
in decision-making are reemployed in the explanation and prediction
of others' behavior?
Does narrative (including film narrative) create emotional and
motivational effects by the same processes that create them in
real-life situations?
Some philosophers think the simulation theory may shed light on
issues in traditional philosophy of mind and language concerning
intentionality, referential opacity, broad and narrow content,
the nature of mental causation, Twin Earth problems, the problem
of other minds, and the peculiarities of self-knowledge. Several
philosophers have applied the theory to aesthetics, ethics, and
philosophy of the social sciences. Success or failure of these
efforts to answer philosophical problems may be considered empirical
tests of the theory, in a suitably broad sense of "empirical."
The following collections include most of the relevant papers
by authors mentioned in the article:
- Carruthers, P. & Smith, P., eds., 1996, Theories of
Theories of Mind. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- Davies, M. and Stone T., eds., 1995, Folk Psychology: The
Theory of Mind Debate. Oxford: Blackwell Publishers. (The
introductory chapter offers an excellent overview and analysis
of the initial debate.)
- Davies, M. and Stone T., eds., 1995, Mental Simulation:
Evaluations and Applications. Oxford: Blackwell Publishers.
Further Readings:
- Goldman, A., 1993, `The Psychology of Folk Psychology,' The
Behavioral and Brain Sciences, 16: 15-28.
- Gordon, R. M., and J. Barker, 1994, `Autism and the "theory
of mind" debate.' In Philosophical Psychopathology: A
Book of Readings, G. Graham and L. Stephens, eds. MIT Press,
pp. 163-181.
- Gordon, R.M., 1995, `Sympathy, Simulation, and the Impartial
Spectator,' Ethics 105:727-742. Reprinted in Mind and
Morals: Essays on Ethics and Cognitive Science, L. May, M.
Friedman, & A. Clark, eds. MIT Press, 1996.
- Harris, P., 1989, Children and Emotion. Oxford: Blackwell
Publishers.
- Peacocke, C., ed., 1994, Objectivity, Simulation, and the
Unity of Consciousness. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Perner, J., 1991, Understanding the Representational Mind.
Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
- Wellman, H. M., 1990, The Child's Theory of Mind. Cambridge,
MA: MIT Press.
Acknowledgment
This entry is adapted, with permission, from "Simulation
vs Theory Theory," the MIT Encyclopedia of Cognitive Science
(MIT Press, 1999)
eliminativism |
folk psychology, as a theory
Copyright © 1997 by
Robert M. Gordon
gordon@umsl.edu
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First published: December 8, 1997
Content last modified: December 8, 1997