1. Examples for non-trivial quantum effects in biological systems are: coherent excitations of biomolecules, quantum tunneling of protons, van der Waals forces, ultrafast dynamics through conical intersections, photon-assisted electron tunneling as the basis for smell, entangled states in photosynthesis, mechanisms for magnetoreception in the avian compass. For a competent review of these examples and more see Huelga and Plenio (2013).

2. This statement reflects a philosophical position which is known as incompatibilism. It is more or less implicitly shared by most scientists thinking about the options quantum theory offers for free will. On a compatibilist presumption, free will does not necessarily contradict determinism(see the entries on compatibilism and arguments for incompatibilism). Quantum based incompatibilist approaches are, e.g., due to Kane (1996) or Müller and Briegel (2014). See also Section 4.

3. See Atmanspacher and beim Graben (2007) for a more detailed discussion of contextual conditions in the description of emergent properties in physics and in cognitive neuroscience.

4. The abbreviation NMDA refers to N-methyl-D-aspartate, the synthetic agonist that activates NMDA receptors.

5. Notice that von Neumann’s chain of observing systems does not leave the material domain. When he refers to subjective (mental) experiences, he presupposes some psychophysical parallelism allowing him to treat these experiences as brain processes.

6. In his later writings, he repudiated this point of view about the role of consciousness, stating that "it is outside the realm of quantum mechanics" (Wigner 1977).

7. A critical discussion of the problems for Wigner’s approach to measurement, together with the presentation of alternatives, can be found in Esfeld (1999).

8. Margenau’s notion of latent observables (Margenau, 1950) and d’Espagnat’s notion of an independent reality (d’Espagnat, 1999) are similar ways to achieve such an ontological interpretation of quantum theory.

9. Related proposals based on a similar idea are due to Fröhlich (1968) and Pribram (1971).

10. An often used argument against direct mental-physical interaction is that energy conservation as a base physical principle would be violated. Cucu and Pitts (2019) showed in detail that and why this argument is a non sequitur.

11. For example, it has been shown in ESA space flight experiments that gravitation seems to be necessary for the development of an ordered network of microtubuli (Papaseit et al., 2000). However, there is no obvious relation between this result and objective state reduction.

12. This idea can be traced back to early work by Claude Bernard in the mid 19th century. It was backed up 50 years later by Hans Meyer and Charles Overton who found significant correlations between the potency of anesthetic gases in animals and their solubility in a hydrophobic environment resembling olive oil.

13. See also Emary et al. (2014) and Mahler (2015) for an informed overview of temporal Bell inequalities and their ramifications in quantum physics.

14. Spencer-Brown (1969, Chap. 1) proposed such a procedure emphatically as the basis of all cognitive activity: “We take as given the idea of distinction and the idea of indication, and that we cannot make an indication without drawing a distinction.”

15. The domain of the psychophysically neutral may be difficult to interpret at first glance, but a careful study reveals a plurality of concepts (in science, philosophy, and even the arts) that in fact are neither mental nor physical. See Atmanspacher (2024) for discussion.

16. The pioneering quantum conception of information is von Weizsäcker’s ur-theory (Weizsäcker, 1985), most prominent is Wheeler’s often misunderstood ‘it from bit’ (Wheeler 1994). Other proposals are due to Zeilinger (Brukner and Zeilinger 2003) and Clifton et al. (2003). See also Chalmers (1996) for a discussion of information-based dual aspects without reference to quantum theory.

17. It is obvious that the term ‘mental’ is used here with a connotation more general than that of consciousness. Preconscious, subconscious, and unconscious domains, personal and collective, are included as well.