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The idea that reasons can be causes even though rational explanation is a distinctive form of explanation, can be seen already to imply a view of the mind that treats mental events as identical with, but not reducible to, physical events. This idea is developed in later papers, especially `Mental Events' (1970) in which Davidson argues for the compatibility of three principles: (i) that at least some mental events interact causally with physical events (`The Principle of Causal Interaction'); (ii) that events related as cause and effect fall under strict laws (`The Principle of the Nomological Character of Causality'); and (iii) that there are no strict laws relating mental and physical events (`The Anomalism of the Mental').
Davidson takes events to be particulars, and so he holds that the same event can be referred to under more than one description. Since laws are linguistic, and so relate events only under particular descriptions, events will only instantiate laws as those events are described in particular ways. As a consequence of this the same events may instantiate a particular law under one description but not under another. But while nomological relations between events depend on the descriptions under which the events are given, relations of causality and identity obtain irrespective of descriptions. The same pair of events may be related causally, then, and yet, under certain descriptions, there be no strict law under which those events fall (of course, if the events are indeed causally related, then there must be some description under which they are nomologically related). In particular, it is possible that a mental event - an event given under some mental description - will not be connected, by means of any strict law, with any physical event - an event under some physical description - even though those events may be causally related, simply because there will be no law that connects those events under just those descriptions. That there are indeed no strict psychophysical laws, according to Davidson, follows from the fact that events under mental descriptions are constrained by principles of overall consistency and coherence - principles of rationality - that do not obtain with respect to events described in physical terms. Thus, while there is identity between mental and physical events (`monism'), there is no possibility of definitional or nomological reduction (`anomalism').
Davidson's commitment to the rationality of the mental as one of the cornerstones of anomalous monism, as well as of the project of `radical interpretation', has led him to take a special interest in the problem of apparently irrational belief and action - a problem first addressed in `How is Weakness of the Will Possible?' (1970). While Davidson treats irrationality as a real feature of our mental lives, he offers two ways of dealing with it that, in some sense, aim at nonetheless preserving the overall rationality of the mind (see especially `Two Paradoxes of Irrationality' [1974]). The first way takes irrationality to be explicable in terms of some cause that is not itself a reason: so, to take one example, a desire that something wished for be true may give rise to the belief that what is wished for is true, but the desire operates as a cause not as a reason. The second way, which is perhaps the more important since it explains how an individual can hold apparently inconsistent beliefs, treats the mind as weakly `partitioned' so that different attitudes may be located within different `territories' and need not, therefore, be taken to come into direct conflict.
The Davidsonian model (first suggested in `Theories of Meaning and Learnable Languages' [1965]) for a theory of meaning for a language L takes the form of a Tarski-style truth theory in which every sentence s of L is matched with a corresponding meta-language sentence that is truth-functionally equivalent to s. In this way we arrive at T-sentences such as "'Schnee ist weiss' is true if and only if snow is white." In order to overcome Tarski's own qualms about applying his approach to natural languages, an important part of Davidson's work has been to show how features of natural language that appear to require resources beyond those available to the basic Tarskian approach can, nevertheless, be analysed so as to make them amenable to a Tarskian treatment. Consequently, Davidson has advanced accounts of the logical form of adverbial modification (in `Adverbs of Action' [1985]) and indirect speech (`Quotation' [1979] and `On Saying That' [1968]) that attempt to bring these features of natural language into line with his appropriation of Tarski. Yet a theory of meaning for a natural language must be an empirical theory and empirically testable; moreover, the formal constraints that the basic Tarskian account provides are inadequate for a fully-fledged theory of meaning. Both of these issues are dealt with at the same time through embedding the Tarskian approach in a more general theory of interpretation, the broad outlines of which are derived from Quine's notion of `radical translation' and which Davidson refers to as `radical interpretation' (the emphasis on interpretation here is indicative of Davidson's more properly semantic interest compared to Quine).
The question that Davidson sets himself explicitly in papers such as `Radical Interpretation' (1973) and `Belief and the Basis of Meaning' (1974) is `what do we need to know if we are to interpret the utterances of a speaker?' The answer to this question is given through elaborating the practice of the radical interpreter faced with the task of assigning meanings to the utterances of a speaker without reliance on prior knowledge or acquaintance. Not only does radical interpretation enable us to test whether a particular theory of meaning is indeed a theory that is empirically true of a particular speaker's utterances, but it also enables us to refine and modify our theories in light of the empirical evidence available. The key to Davidson's approach is the idea of a close interconnection between the task of assigning meanings to utterances and identifying the contents of beliefs (as well as of desires). We know what a speaker means by an utterance when we know what belief she or he intends it to express. Identifying meanings is thus inseparable from the task of attributing beliefs - if we could only get access to a speaker's beliefs, then, provided we could identify instances of the speaker's holding sentences true, we could match beliefs with utterances and so gain access to the meanings of those utterances. Davidson argues that the way to get this process started, and, indeed, the way in which it continues, is through the application of the principle of charity (a version of which is also to be found in Quine): assume that most of the speaker's beliefs are in agreement with our own and that most of the speaker's beliefs are therefore true, by our lights at least. This enables us to fix beliefs in a way that allows preliminary assignments of meanings to utterances, which assignments can then be tested against actual linguistic behaviour, modified where appropriate, and then applied in turn in order to generate modifications to the set of beliefs originally attributed ... and so on. Through balancing attributions of belief against assignments of meaning we are able to move towards an overall theory of behaviour for speakers that combines both a theory of meaning and belief within a single theory of interpretation.
Davidson's holistic view of the relation between truth, meaning, belief and desire is thus tied to an externalist view of the nature of content. It is through being able to relate a speaker to some object or objects in the world to which you, as interpreter, are also related that one is able to assign content to the speaker's utterances and identify the speaker's beliefs. In the same way, through interacting both with other speakers and the world, one is able to understand oneself as believing, desiring and speaking. It is this three-way structure to which Davidson refers using the metaphor of `triangulation' (for the first time in `Rational Animals' [1985 - originally published 1982]). In this respect, although there is the presumption that speakers must, for the most part, know what they mean and believe simply as a consequence of their rationality, self-knowledge is not fundamentally different from, nor is it independent of, knowledge of others. In fact knowledge of self, of others and of the world form a single interconnected structure in which each element is a necessary support for the others.
The holistic conception of the relation between these `varieties' of knowledge can be seen to underlie Davidson's rejection of scepticism and of relativism. This point has sometimes been obscured, however, by Davidson's presentation of his argument against scepticism, in a number of places, through the employment (for the first time in `Thought and Talk' [1975]) of the rather problematic notion of an omniscient interpreter who, while he knows everything there is to know about the world, must, if he is to interpret us, nevertheless assume that most of our beliefs are in agreement with his own and are, therefore, mostly true. Davidson seems largely to have abandoned this argument in his more recent discussions and his anti-scepticism is, indeed, more usefully viewed as depending simply on the holistic interdependence that obtains between the different forms of knowledge and which make such knowledge possible (this interdependence does, in fact, underlie the `omniscient interpreter' argument, even if other features of that argument tend to detract attention from it). To doubt that most of our beliefs are true (at least so far as our most basic beliefs are concerned) is thus to doubt the very possibility that we have beliefs.The sceptic may wish to doubt even this, but at that point it becomes unclear what sense at all is to be attached to the sceptic's doubts. Similarly the relativist who holds that there can be radical discontinuities in belief or in the world between ourselves and others (and against whom Davidson argues in `On the Very Idea of a Conceptual Scheme' [1974]) misunderstands the extent to which a vast body of agreed, true belief is a necessary presupposition even of the attribution of belief.
Although Davidson emphasises the holistic interconnections between beliefs, as well as between the concepts of belief, truth and knowledge, and has at times referred to his position as a `Coherence Theory of Truth and Knowledge' (in `A Coherence Theory of Truth and Knowledge' [1983]), he is not a coherentist about truth or knowledge. Nor, for all that he adopts a Tarskian approach to meaning, does he espouse a correspondence theory of truth. Davidson eschews any attempt to provide an account of the nature of truth, maintaining that truth is an absolutely central concept that cannot be reduced to or replaced by any other notion. Davidson's employment of the notion of coherence is tied to his rejection of those forms of epistemological foundationalism that would attempt to ground knowledge or belief in the sensory causes of belief - beliefs, as one might expect given Davidson's holism, can find evidential support only in other beliefs. Similarly, his sometime employment of the notion of correspondence, particularly in his later discussions (see especially `Three Varieties of Knowledge' [1991]), is intended, not so much to provide any direct elucidation of the nature of truth, as to indicate the way in which the identification of beliefs and other attitudes depends on identifying the objects of belief. Since Davidson rejects both sceptical and relativist positions, while nevertheless insisting of the indispensibility of a irreducibly basic concept of objective truth, Davidson cannot be easily situated with respect to the realist/anti-realist controversy that, until quite recently, was a major concern of many anglo-american philosophers. The Davidsonian position has, nevertheless, been variously assimilated, at different times and by different critics, to both the realist and the anti-realist camp. Yet as Davidson makes clear in his 1989 Dewey Lectures (`The Structure and Content of Truth' [1990]), he not only rejects many of the assumptions on which the dispute between the realist and anti-realist is based, but also views that dispute as essentially misconceived.
First published: May 29, 1996
Content last modified: July 17, 1997