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Gottlob Frege

Gottlob Frege (b. 1848, d. 1925) was a German mathematician, logician, and philosopher who worked at the University of Jena. Frege constructed the first predicate calculus, developed a new analysis of basic propositions and quantification, formalized the notion of a proof in terms that are still accepted today, and demonstrated that one could resolve theoretical mathematical statements in terms of simpler logical and mathematical notions (for example, Frege was the first to propose a definition of the natural numbers in terms of sets or extensions). To ground his views about the nature of logic, Frege conceived a comprehensive philosophy of language that many philosophers still find insightful. However, his lifelong project, of showing that mathematics was reducible to logic, was not successful.

Frege's Life

Frege's Advances in Logic

Frege virtually founded the modern discipline of mathematical logic. He forever changed the way philosophers and mathematical logicians think about the predicate calculus, the analysis of simple sentences and quantifier phrases, proofs, the foundations of mathematics, definitions, and the `natural numbers'.

The Predicate Calculus. In an attempt to realize Leibniz's ideas for a language of thought and a rational calculus, Frege developed a formal notation for expressing concepts and proving propositions (see his Begriffsschrift ). Though we no longer use his notation, Frege's system constituted the first predicate calculus and the first system powerful enough to resolve the essential logic of mathematical reasoning. Frege's predicate calculus was in fact a second-order predicate calculus and it was based on the `function-argument' analysis of sentences. This freed logicians from the limitations of the `subject-predicate' analysis of sentences that formed the basis of Aristotelian logic and paved the way for a general treatment of quantification.

The Analysis of Atomic Sentences and Quantifier Phrases. In traditional Aristotelian logic, simple sentences involving intransitive verbs and transitive verbs are treated on a logical par. For example, "John loves Mary" is analyzed in essentially the same way as "John is happy". In each case, there is a subject (`John') which denotes an object and a predicate (`is happy', `loves Mary') which denotes a property of the object. In Frege's logic, however, sentences involving intransitive verbs and transitive verbs are rigorously distinguished. Frege took intransitive verb phrases such as `is happy' to be functions of one variable (`x is happy'), and resolved the sentence "John is happy" in terms of the application of the function denoted by `is happy' to the argument denoted by `John'. Moreover, Frege took the verb phrase `loves' to be a function of two variables (`x loves y') and resolved the sentence `John loves Mary' as the application of the function denoted by `x loves y' to the objects denoted by `John' and `Mary' respectively. In contrast to Aristotelian logic, this analysis reveals that the following inferences are fundamentally analogous:

Frege now had the key to a general treatment of quantification. No matter whether the quantified expression `something' appears within a subject ("Something loves Mary") or within a predicate ("John loves something"), it is to be resolved in the same way. In effect, Frege treated quantified expressions as variable-binding operators. The variable-binding operator `some x is such that' can bind the variable `x' in the expression `x loves Mary' as well as the variable `x' in the expression `John loves x'. Thus, Frege analyzed the above inferences in the following general way: In contrast to Aristotelian logic, a single inference rule justifies both inferences.

Proof. As part of his predicate calculus, Frege developed a strict definition of a `proof' as a sequence of well-formed formulas every member of which is either an axiom or follows from previous members by a rule of inference. This is essentially the definition of a proof that logicians still use today.

A Foundation for Mathematics. Frege attempted to construct a foundation for mathematics. His most comprehensive logical system was developed in his landmark work Grundgesetze der Arithmetik, in which he attempted to validate the philosophical doctrine known as logicism, i.e., the idea that mathematical concepts can be defined in terms of purely logical concepts and that mathematical axioms can be derived from the laws of logic alone. Unfortunately, Frege employed a principle in the Grundgesetze (Basic Law V) which turned out to be subject to Russell's Paradox. This paradox caused him to question the truth of logicism, and few philosophers today believe that mathematics can be reduced to logic, if only because Frege's system included a primitive notion which many philosophers regard as mathematical, namely, the notion of a set or extension. Despite the fact that a contradiction invalidated a part of his system, the intricate theoretical web of definitions and proofs developed in the Grundgesetze produced a conceptual framework for mathematical logic that was nothing short of revolutionary. There is no doubt that the logical system and maze of definitions developed by Bertrand Russell and Alfred North Whitehead in Principia Mathematica owe a huge debt to the work found in Frege's Grundgesetze.

Definition. Frege was extremely careful about the proper description and definition of mathematical objects. He developed powerful and insightful criticisms of mathematical work which did not meet his standards for clarity. For example, he criticized mathematicians who defined a variable to be a number that varies rather than an expression of language which can vary as to which determinate number it refers to. And he criticized those mathematicians who developed `piecemeal' definitions or `creative' definitions. In the Grundgesetze (Band II, Sections 56-67) Frege criticized the practice of defining a concept on a given range of objects and later redefining the concept on a wider, more inclusive range of concepts. Frequently, this `piecemeal' style of definition led to conflict, since the redefined concept did not always reduce to the original concept when one restricts the range to the original class of objects. In that same work (Band II, Sections 139-147), Frege criticised the mathematical practise of introducing notation to name (unique) entities without first proving that there exist (unique) such entities. He pointed out that such `creative definitions' were simply unjustified.

The Natural Numbers. Notwithstanding the flaw in his system, Frege successfully defined the notion of a `cardinal number' in terms of the primitive notion of an extension or set. The insight behind the definition is that cardinal numbers attach to properties or concepts. Thus Frege defines the (cardinal) number of the concept F as the extension of the concept being a concept equinumerous to F. Frege defined `natural number' in terms of the definition of `the ancestral of a relation R', which he had developed in his earlier Begriffsschrift. If given a series of facts of the form aRb, bRc, cRd, and so on, Frege showed how to define the relation x comes before y in the R-series (this is the ancestral of the relation R). To exploit this definition in the case of natural numbers, Frege first defined the relational concept x precedes y:

x precedes y iff there is a concept F and an object z such that: (1) z falls under F, (2) y is the (cardinal) number of the concept F, and (3) x is the (cardinal) number of the concept object other than z falling under F
In the notation of the second-order predicate calculus, Frege's definition becomes:
Frege then defined the number 0 as the (cardinal) number of the concept being an object not identical with itself. Finally he defined:
x is a natural number iff either 0 comes before x in the predecessor series or 0 = x
In other words, a natural number is any member of the predecessor series beginning with 0. Frege then validly derived the Dedekind/Peano Axioms for number theory from a powerful and consistent principle now known as Hume's Principle ("The number of Fs is equal to the number of Gs if and only if there is a one-to-one correspondence between the Fs and the Gs"). Following the lead of George Boolos, philosophers today call derivation of the Dedekind/Peano Axioms from Hume's Principle `Frege's Theorem'. The proof of Frege's Theorem involved some of the most beautiful, subtle, and complex logical reasoning that had ever been devised.

Frege's Ontology and Philosophy of Language

While pursuing his investigations into mathematics and logic (and quite possibly, in order to ground those investigations), Frege was led to develop not only an ontology of functions and objects but also a philosophy of language. In his ontology, Frege asserted the existence of two special objects, namely, the truth values The True and The False and defined concepts as a special kind of function, namely, any function that mapped objects to truth values. He also suggested that existence is not a property of objects but rather of concepts. Frege is most well-known among philosophers, however, for the way these ideas were applied and extended in his philosophy of language. His seminal paper in this field `Über Sinn und Bedeutung' (`On Sense and Denotation') is now a classic. In this paper, Frege considered two puzzles about language and noticed, in each case, that one cannot account for the meaningfulness or logical behavior of certain sentences simply on the basis of the denotations of the terms (names and descriptions) in the sentence. One puzzle concerned identity statements and the other concerned sentences with relative clauses such as propositional attitude reports. To solve these puzzles, Frege suggested that the terms of a language have both a sense and a denotation (i.e., that at least two semantic relations are required to explain the significance or meaning of the terms of a language). This idea has inspired research in the field for over a century.

Frege's Ontology. In Frege's ontology, functions and objects were rigorously distinguished as two fundamentally different kinds of entity. Functions are the kind of thing that take objects as arguments and map those arguments to a value. Frege did not limit examples of functions to mathematical functions such as x + 3. He allowed the variable x to range over any object, and so father of x is a genuine example of a function---it maps certain biological offspring to their fathers and maps everything else to The False. Frege associates with every function, a course-of-values. The course-of-values of a function explicitly indicates the value of the function for each object that is supplied as an argument. In addition, Frege believed that there are two distinguished objects, namely, the truth value The True and the truth-value The False. Those functions which map objects to truth values are called concepts. For example, not only is the mathematical function x +3 = 5 a concept (this concept maps the number 2 to The True and everything else to The False), but so is the function x is happy (which maps anything that is happy to The True and everything else to The False). Frege defines the extension of a concept to contain just those objects which the concept maps to The True (as indicated by the course-of-values associated with the concept).

Frege suggested that existence is not a property of objects but rather of concepts: it is the property a concept has just in case it has an non-empty extension (i.e., just in case it maps some object to The True). So the fact that the extension of the concept martian is empty underlies the ordinary claim "Martians don't exist." Frege therefore took existence to be a `second-level' concept.

Frege's Puzzle About Identity Statements. Here are some examples of identity statements:

117 + 136 = 253.
The morning star is identical to the evening star.
Mark Twain is Samuel Clemens.
Bill is Debbie's father.
Frege believed that these statements all have the form "a = b ", where `a ' and `b ' are either names or descriptions that denote individuals. He naturally assumed that a sentence of the form "a = b " is true if and only if the object denoted by `a ' is the same as the object denoted by `b '. For example, "117 + 136 = 253" is true if and only if `117 + 236' and `253' denote the same number. And "Mark Twain is Samuel Clemens" is true if and only if `Mark Twain' and `Samuel Clemens' denote the same person. So the truth of "a = b " requires that the expressions flanking the identity sign denote the same object.

But Frege noticed that on this account of truth, the truth conditions for "a = b " are no different from the truth conditions for "a = a ". For example, the truth conditions for "Mark Twain = Mark Twain" are the same as those for "Mark Twain = Samuel Clemens"; not only do the names flanking the identity sign denote the same object in each case, but the object is the same between the two cases. The problem is that the cognitive significance (or meaning) of the two sentences differ. We can learn that "Mark Twain = Mark Twain" is true simply by inspecting it; but we can't learn the truth of "Mark Twain = Samuel Clemens" simply by inspecting it. Similarly, whereas you can learn that "117 + 136 = 117 + 136" and "the morning star is identical to the morning star" are true simply by inspection, you can't learn the truth of "117 + 136 = 253" and "the morning star is identical to the evening star" simply by inspection. In the latter cases, you have to do some arithmetical work or astronomical investigation to learn the truth of these identity claims.

So the puzzle Frege discovered is: if we cannot appeal to a difference in denotation of the terms flanking the identity sign, how do we explain the difference in cognitive significance between "a = b " and "a = a "?

Frege's Puzzle About Propositional Attitude Reports. Frege is generally credited with identifying the following puzzle about propositional attitude reports, even though he didn't quite describe the puzzle in the terms used below. A propositional attitude is a psychological relation between a person and a proposition. Belief, desire, intention, discovery, knowledge, etc., are all psychological relationships between persons, on the one hand, and propositions, on the other. When we report the propositional attitudes of others, these reports all have a similar logical form:

x believes that p
x desires that p
x intends that p
x discovered that p
x knows that p
If we replace the variable `x ' by the name of a person and replace the variable `p ' with a sentence that describes the propositional object of their attitude, we get specific attitude reports. So by replacing `x ' by `John' and `p ' by "Mark Twain wrote Huckleberry Finn " in the first example, the result would be the following specific belief report:
John believes that Mark Twain wrote Huckleberry Finn.

To see the problem posed by the analysis of propositional attitude reports, consider what appears to be a simple principle of reasoning, namely, the Principle of Substitution. If a name, say n, appears in a true sentence S, and the identity sentence n=m is true, then the Principle of Substitution tells us that the substitution of the name m for the name n in S does not affect the truth of S. For example, let S be the true sentence "Mark Twain was an author", let n be the name `Mark Twain', and let m be the name `Samuel Clemens'. Then since the identity sentence "Mark Twain = Samuel Clemens" is true, we can substitute `Samuel Clemens' for `Mark Twain' without affecting the truth of the sentence. And indeed, the resulting sentence "Samuel Clemens was an author" is true. In other words, the following argument is valid:

Mark Twain was an author.
Mark Twain = Samuel Clemens.
Therefore, Samuel Clemens was an author.
Similarly, the following argument is valid.
4 > 3
4 = 8/2
Therefore, 8/2 > 3
In general, then, the Principle of Substitution seems to take the following form, where S is a sentence, n and m are names, and S(n ) differs from S(m ) only by the fact that at least one occurrence of m replaces n:
S(n )
n = m
Therefore, S(m )
This principle seems to capture the idea that if we say something true about an object, then even if we change the name by which we refer to that object, we should still be saying something true about that object.

But Frege, in effect, noticed following counterexample to the Principle of Substitution. Consider the following argument:

John believes that Mark Twain wrote Huckleberry Finn .
Mark Twain = Samuel Clemens.
Therefore, John believes that Samuel Clemens wrote Huckleberry Finn .
This argument is not valid. There are circumstances in which the premises are true and the conclusion false. We have already described such circumstances, namely, one in which John learns the name `Mark Twain' by reading Huckleberry Finn but learns the name `Samuel Clemens' in the context of learning about 19th century American authors (without learning that the name `Mark Twain' was a pseudonym for Samuel Clemens). John may not believe that Samuel Clemens wrote Huckleberry Finn. The premises of the above argument, therefore, do not logically entail the conclusion. So the Principle of Substitution appears to break down in the context of propositional attitude reports. The puzzle, then, is to say what causes the principle to fail in these contexts. Why aren't we still saying something true about the man in question if all we have done is changed the name by which we refer to him?

Frege's Theory of Sense and Denotation. To explain these puzzles, Frege suggested that in addition to having a denotation, names and descriptions also express a sense. The sense of a expression accounts for its cognitive significance---it is the way by which one conceives of the denotation of the term. The expressions `4' and `8/2' have the same denotation but express different senses, different ways of conceiving the same number. The descriptions `the morning star' and `the evening star' denote the same planet, namely Venus, but express different ways of conceiving of Venus and so have different senses. The name `Pegasus' and the description `the most powerful Greek god' both have a sense (and their senses are distinct), but neither has a denotation. However, even though the names `Mark Twain' and `Samuel Clemens' denote the same individual, they express different senses. Using the distinction between sense and denotation, Frege can account for the difference in cognitive significance between identity statements of the form "a = a" and "a = b". The sense of the whole statement, on Frege's view, is a function of the senses of its component parts. Since the sense of `a' differs from the sense of `b', the components of "a = a" and "a = b" are different and so the sense of the whole expression will be different in the two cases. Since the sense of an expression accounts for its cognitive significance, Frege has an explanation of the difference in cognitive significance between "a = a" and "a = b", and thus a solution to the first puzzle.

Moreover, Frege proposed that when a term (name or description) follows a propositional attitude verb, it no longer denotes what it ordinarily denotes. Instead, Frege claims that in such contexts, a term denotes its ordinary sense. This explains why the Principle of Substitution fails for terms following the propositional attitude verbs in propositional attitude reports. The Principle asserts that truth is preserved when we substitute one name for another having the same denotation. But, according to Frege's theory, the names `Mark Twain' and `Samuel Clemens' denote different senses when they occur in the following sentences:

John believes that Mark Twain wrote Huckleberry Finn.
John believes that Samuel Clemens wrote Huckleberry Finn.
If they don't denote the same object, then there is no reason to think that substitution of one name for another would preserve truth.

Frege developed the theory of sense and denotation into a thoroughgoing philosophy of language. This philosophy can be explained, at least in outline, by considering a simple sentence such as "John loves Mary". In Frege's view, each word in this sentence is a name and, moreover, the sentence as a whole is a complex name. Each of these names has both a sense and a denotation. Then sense and denotation of the words are basic; but sense and denotation of the sentence as a whole can be described in terms of the sense and denotation of the words and the way in which those words are arranged in the sentence. Let us refer to the denotation and sense of the words as follows:

d[j] refers to the denotation of the name `John'.
d[m] refers to the denotation of the name `Mary'.
d[L] refers to the denotation of the name `loves'.
s[j] refers to the sense of the name `John'.
s[m] refers to the sense of the name `Mary'.
s[L] refers to the sense of the name `loves'.
We now work toward a theoretical description of the denotation of the sentence as a whole. On Frege's view, d[j] and d[m] are the real individuals John and Mary, respectively. d[L] is a function that maps d[m] (i.e., Mary) to a function which serves as the denotation of the predicate `loves Mary'. Let us refer to that function as d[Lm]. Now the function d[Lm] maps d[j] (i.e., John) to the denotation of the sentence "John loves Mary". Let us refer to the denotation of the sentence as d[jLm]. Frege identifies the denotation of a sentence as one of the two truth values. Because d[Lm] maps objects to truth values, it is a concept. Thus, d[jLm] is the truth value The True if the extension of the concept d[Lm] contains John; otherwise it is the truth value The False. So, on Frege's view, the sentence "John loves Mary" names a truth value.

The sentence "John loves Mary" also expresses a sense. Its sense may be described as follows. First, s[L] (the sense of the name "loves") is identified as a function. This function maps s[m] (the sense of the name "Mary") to the sense of the predicate `loves Mary'. Let us refer to the sense of `loves Mary' as s[Lm]. Now the function s[Lm] maps s[j] (the sense of the name `John') to the sense of the whole sentence. Let us call the sense of the entire sentence s[jLm]. Frege calls the sense of a sentence a thought, and whereas there are only two truth values, he supposes that there are an infinite number of thoughts.

On Frege's view, therefore, the sentences "4 = 8/2" and "4 = 4" both name the same truth value, but they express different thoughts. That is because s[4] is different from s[8/2]. Similarly, "Mark Twain = Mark Twain" and "Mark Twain = Samuel Clemens" denote the same truth value, but express different thoughts (since the sense of the names differ). Thus, Frege has a general account of the difference in the cognitive significance between identity statements of the form "a = a" and "a = b". Furthermore, recall that Frege proposed that terms following propositional attitude verbs denote not their ordinary denotations but rather the senses they ordinarily express. In fact, in the following propositional attitude report, not only do the words `Mark Twain', `wrote' and `Huckleberry Finn ' denote their ordinary senses, but the entire sentence "Mark Twain wrote Huckleberry Finn" also denotes its ordinary sense (namely, a thought):

John believes that Mark Twain wrote Huckleberry Finn.
Frege, therefore, would analyze this attitude report as follows: "believes that" denotes a function that maps the denotation of the sentence "Mark Twain wrote Huckleberry Finn" to a concept. In this case, however, the denotation of the sentence "Mark Twain wrote Huckleberry Finn" is not a truth value but rather a thought. The thought it denotes is different from the thought denoted by "Samuel Clemens wrote Huckleberry Finn" in the following propositional attitude report:
John believes that Samuel Clemens wrote Huckleberry Finn.
Since the thought denoted by "Samuel Clemens wrote Huckleberry Finn" in this context differs from the thought denoted by "Mark Twain wrote Huckleberry Finn" in the same context, the concept denoted by `believes that Mark Twain wrote Huckleberry Finn' is a different concept from the one denoted by `believes that Samuel Clemens wrote Huckleberry Finn'. One may consistently suppose that the concept denoted by the former predicate maps John to The True whereas the the concept denoted by the latter predicate does not. Frege's analysis therefore preserves our intuition that John can believe that Mark Twain wrote Huckleberry Finn without believing that Samuel Clemens did. It also preserves the Principle of Substitution---the fact that one cannot substitute "Samuel Clemens" for "Mark Twain" when these names occur after propositional attitude verbs does not constitute evidence against the Principle. For if Frege is right, names do not have their usual denotation when they occur in these contexts.

Frege's Writings

Frege's Main Writings

Frege's Other Writings

Translations of Frege's Writings into English

Bibliography

Other Internet Resources

Related Entries

denotation | intensional logic | logicism | mathematics, philosophy of | predicate calculus | quantification | Russell, Bertrand | Russell's Paradox | sense

Copyright © 1995, 1997 by
Edward N. Zalta
zalta@mally.stanford.edu

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First published: September 14, 1995
Content last modified: May 8, 1997