Table of Contents
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After graduation Hegel worked as a tutor for families in Bern then Frankfurt, where he wrote early works on religious themes. In 1801 he moved to Jena, the university town in the cultural hot-house of Weimar, to which Schelling had earlier moved. There he was "habilitated" and up until 1804 collaborated with Schelling. During this time Hegel's philosophy was strongly influenced by that of Schelling who in turn had been influenced by but was in the process of breaking away from J. G. Fichte. In 1802 Hegel published his first philosophical work, The Difference between Fichte's and Schelling's System of Philosophy in which he argued that Schelling's approach succeeded where Fichte's failed in the project of systematising and thereby completing Kant's transcendental idealism.
In 1807 Hegel published his Phenomenology of Spirit which showed a divergence from his earlier more Schellingian thought. Schelling, who had left Jena in 1803, interpreted a barbed criticism in the Phenomenology's preface as aimed at him, and their friendship abruptly ended. The occupation of Jena by Napoleon's troops closed the university and Hegel left, working for a short time as an editor of a newspaper in Bamberg, and then from 1808-1816 as the headmaster and philosophy teacher at a "gymnasium" in Nuremberg, during which time he wrote and published his Science of Logic. In 1816 he took up a chair in philosophy at the University of Heidelberg, then in 1818 the chair of philosophy at the University of Berlin, the most prestigious position in the German philosophical world. While in Heidelberg he published the Encyclopaedia of the Philosophical Sciences, a systematic work in which an abbreviated version of the earlier Science of Logic (the "lesser logic") was followed by the application of its principles to the Philosophy of Nature and the Philosophy of Spirit. In 1821 in Berlin Hegel published an expanded and developed version of a section of the encyclopaedia Philosophy of Spirit dealing with political philosophy, Elements of the Philosophy of Right. During the following ten years up to his death from cholera in 1831 he continued to teach at Berlin, and published subsequent versions of the Encyclopaedia. After his death versions of his lectures on philosophy of history, philosophy of religion, aesthetics, and the history of philosophy were published.
After Hegel's death, Schelling, whose reputation had long since been eclipsed by that of Hegel, was invited to take up the chair at Berlin, reputedly because the government of the day had wanted to counter the influence that Hegelian philosophy had developed among a generation of students. Since the early period of his collaboration with Hegel, Schelling had become more religious in his philosophising and criticised the "rationalism" of Hegel's philosophy. During this time of Schelling's tenure at Berlin, important forms of later critical reaction to Hegelian philosophy developed. Hegel supporters divided into "left-" and "right-wing" factions; from out of the former circle, Karl Marx was to develop his own "scientific" approach to society and history which appropriated many Hegelian ideas into a materialistic outlook. (Later, especially in reaction to orthodox Soviet versions of Marxism, many "Western Marxists" re-incorporated further Hegelian elements back into their forms of Marxist philosophy.) Many of Schelling's own criticisms of Hegel's rationalism found their way into subsequent "existentialist" thought, via thinkers such as Kierkegaard (who attended Schelling's lectures). Furthermore, the interpretation Schelling offered of Hegel during these years itself helped to shape subsequent generations' understanding of Hegel, contributing to the orthodox or traditional understanding of Hegel as a "metaphysical" thinker in the pre-Kantian "dogmatic" sense.
In academic philosophy, Hegelian idealism underwent a revival in both Great Britain and the United States towards the end of the nineteenth century. In Britain, where philosophers like T. H Green and F. H. Bradley developed metaphysical ideas which they related back to Hegel's thought, Hegel was seen as one of the main targets of attack by the founders of the emerging "analytic" movement around the turn of the twentieth century, Bertrand Russell and G. E. Moore. For most of the twentieth century, interest in Hegel has been limited to his relation to other more popular philosophical movements like existentialism or Marxism, or to Hegel's social and political thought. In France, a version of Hegelianism came to influence a generation of thinkers, including Jean-Paul Sartre and the psychoanalyst, Jaques Lacan, through the lectures of Alexandre Kojève, an important precursor to the later "post-modern" movement. A later generation of philosophers coming to prominence in the late 1960s and after, tended to react against Hegel in an analogous way to that in which early analytic philosophers had reacted against the Hegel who had influenced their predecessors. In Germany, important Hegelian elements were incorporated into the approach of thinkers of the Frankfurt School, such as Theodor Adorno, and later, Jürgen Habermas, and that of "hermeneutic" thinkers like H. G. Gadamer. In the 1960s the philosopher Klaus Hartmann developed what was termed a non-metaphysical interpretation of Hegel which has played an important role in the revival of Hegelian philosophy over the subsequent period.
On the one hand we can clearly see in the phrase "its own time" the suggestion of a historical or cultural conditionedness and variability which applies even to the highest form of human cognition, philosophy itself -- the contents of philosophical knowledge, we might suspect, will come from the historically changing contents of contemporary culture. On the other, there is the hint that with such contents being "raised" to some higher level, presumably higher than the more everyday levels of cognitive functioning -- those based in everyday perceptual experience, for example. This higher level takes the form of "thought" -- a type of cognition commonly taken as capable of having "eternal" contents (think of Plato and Frege, for example).
This antithetical combination within human cognition of the temporally-conditioned and the eternal, a combination which reflects a broader conception of the human being as what Hegel describes elsewhere as a "finite-infinite", has led to Hegel being regarded in different ways by different types of philosophical readers. For example, towards the end of our century, an historically-minded " anti-realist" like Richard Rorty, distrustful of all claims or aspirations to the "God's-eye view", could praise Hegel as a philosopher who had introduced this historically reflective dimension into philosophy (and setting it on the characteristically "hermeneutic" path which has predominated in modern continental philosophy) but who had unfortunately still become bogged down in the remnants of the Platonistic idea of the search for ahistorical truths. Those adopting such an approach to Hegel tend to have in mind the (relatively) young author of the Phenomenology of Spirit and have tended to dismiss as "metaphysical" later and more systematic works like the Science of Logic. In contrast, the British Hegelian movement at the end of the nineteenth century, for example, tended to ignore the Phenomenology and the more historicist dimensions of his thought, and found in Hegel a systematic metaphysician whose Logic provided a systematic and definitive philosophical ontology of an idealist type. This latter traditional, "metaphysical" view of Hegel had dominated Hegel reception for most of this century, but has over the last few decades been contested by many Hegel scholars who have offered an alternative, "post-Kantian" view of Hegel.
An important consequence of Hegel's metaphysics, so understood, concerns history and the idea of historical development or progress, and it is as advocate of an idea concerning the logically-necessitated teleological course of history that Hegel is most often decried. To many critics Hegel not only was an advocate of a disastrous political conception of the state and the relation of its citizens to it, a conception prefiguring twentieth-century totalitarianism, but had tried to underpin such advocacy with dubious logico-metaphysical speculations. With his idea of the development of "Spirit" in history, Hegel is seen as literalising a way of talking about different cultures in terms of their "spirits", of constructing a developmental sequence of epochs characteristic of nineteenth-century ideas of linear progress, and then enveloping this story of human progress in terms of one about the developing self-conscious of the universe/god itself.
As the bottom line of such an account concerned the evolution of states of a mind (God's), such an account is clearly an idealist one, but not in the sense, say, of Berkeley. The pantheistic legacy inherited by Hegel meant that he had no problem in considering an objective world beyond any particular subjective mind. But this objective world itself had to be understood as conceptually informed, as it were -- it was objectified spirit. Thus in contrast to Berkeleian "subjective idealism" it became common to talk of Hegel as incorporating the "objective idealism" of views, especially common among German historians, in which social life and thought were understood in terms of the conceptual or "spiritual" structures that informed them. But in contrast to both forms of idealism, Hegel, according to this reading, postulated a form of absolute idealism by including both subjective life and the objective cultural practices on which subjective life depends within the dynamics of the development of the self-consciousness and self-actualisation of God, the "Absolute Spirit".
It is hardly surprising, given the more secular character of much twentieth-century philosophy, that Hegel, so understood, would be generally regarded as of merely historical interest. Nevertheless, Hegel was still seen by many as an important precursor of other more characteristically modern strands of thought such as existentialism and Marxist materialism. Existentialists were thought of as taking the idea of the finitude and historical and cultural dependence of individual subjects from Hegel and leaving out all pretensions to the "absolute", while Marxists were thought of as taking the historical dynamics of the Hegelian picture but understanding this in materialist rather than idealist categories. But while the traditional view of Hegel has remained a commonplace throughout this century it has become increasingly questioned as an accurate account of Hegel's philosophy within Hegel scholarship itself. In the last quarter of the twentieth century, an increasing number of Hegel interpreters have argued that such an understanding was seriously flawed, and while various quite different philosophical interpretations of Hegel have emerged which attempt to acquit him of implausible metaphysico-theological views, one common tendency has been to stress the continuity of his ideas with the "critical philosophy" of Immanuel Kant.
To see Hegel as a post-Kantian is to see him as extending that "critical" turn that Kant saw as setting his philosophy on a scientific footing in a way analogous to the work of Copernicus in cosmology. With his Copernican analogy Kant was comparing the way that the positions of the sun and earth were reversed in Copernicus' transformation of cosmology to the way that the positions of knowing subject and known object were reversed in his own transcendental idealism. Objectivity should be thought of not as a matter of mental contents "corresponding" to the object which cannot be independently known; but rather in terms of the justification of mental contents, or judgments, in terms of criteria which are subjective, in the sense of possessed by the mind, but objective in the sense of possessed universally and necessarily by finite intelligences.
No sooner had Kant's philosophy appeared then many objections were raised, among which were complaints about the apparently irreducible gap between the mind qua universal discursive intelligence and the mind as individual psychological reality. Kantian ideas were quickly assimilated with extant Spinozist ideas concerning mind and body as different aspects of an underlying substance to give yield a type of philosophical biology and with philological ideas relativising the structure of mind to the structures of historically variable languages. Other critics pointed to internal inconsistencies in Kant's picture in which the world in itself seemed to be thought of on the one hand as the cause of its appearance, and on the other, as beyond knowledge and its constituent categories such as "cause". Among the ambitions of many of Kant's successors, including Hegel, was that of somehow "completing" Kant. In Hegel especially, so many argue, one can see the ambition to bring together the universalist dimensions of Kant's transcendental program with the culturally particularist conceptions of his more historically and relativistically-minded contemporaries. This resulted in his controversial conception of "spirit", as developed in his Phenomenology of Spirit. With this notion, it has been argued, Hegel was pursing the Kantian question of the conditions of rational human "mindedness" rather than being concerned with giving an account of the developing self-consciousness of God. But while Kant had limited such conditions to "formal" structures of the mind, Hegel extended them to include aspects of historically and socially determined forms of embodied existence.
Something of Hegel's phenomenological method may be conveyed by the first few chapters, which are perhaps among the more conventionally philosophical parts. Chapters 1 to 3 effectively follow a developmental series of "shapes of consciousness" which are based on different implicit criteria for epistemic certainty. Chapter 1, "Sense-certainty" considers an epistemological attitude involving an appeal to some immediately given mental content -- the sort of role played by "sense data" in some twentieth-century approaches to philosophy, for example. By following the protagonist's attempts to make these implicit criteria explicit we are meant to appreciate that any mental content, even the apparently most "immediate", in fact contain implicit concepts, and so, in Hegel's terminology, are "mediated". (In more recent terminology one might talk of the "concept-" or "theory-ladenness" of all experience.)
By the end of this chapter our protagonist consciousness (and by implication, we the audience to this drama) has learnt that the structure of consciousness cannot be as originally thought, rather its contents must have some implicit universal (conceptual) aspect to them. Consciousness thus now commences anew with its new implicit criterion -- the assumption that since the contents of consciousness are "universal" they must be publicly graspable by others as well. Hegel's name for this type of direct perceptual realism in which any individual's private apprehension will always be correctable by the group is "perception". As with the case for "sense-certainty", here again, by following the protagonist consciousness's efforts to make this implicit criterion explicit, we see how the criterion generates contradictions which eventually undermine it as a criterion for certainty. In fact, such collapse into a type of self-generated scepticism is typical of all the "shapes" we follow in the work -- there seems something inherently skeptical about such mental processes. But Hegel's point is equally that there has always been something that has been learned in such processes, and this learning is more than the that which consists in the mere elimination of dead-ends such that we are left free to pursue some alternative (a type of philosophical equivalent to Popperian falsification in science). Rather, as in the way that the internal contradictions that emerged from sense-certainty had generated a new shape, perception, the collapse of any given attitude always involves the emergence of some new implicit criterion which will be the basis of a new emergent attitude. With "perception" the emergent shape of consciousness is that Hegel calls "understanding" -- a shape which he identifies with scientific cognition rather than that of everyday intersubjective "perception".
The transition from chapter 3 to 4 "The Truth of Self-Certainty", also marks a more general transition from "consciousness" to "self-consciousness". It is in the course of chapter 4 that we find what is perhaps the most well-known part of the Phenomenology, the account of the "struggle of recognition" in which Hegel examines the intersubjective conditions which he sees as among the necessary conditions for any form of "consciousness".
Like Kant, Hegel thinks that the "consciousness" of something as being other than the self requires self-reflexivity, that is, requires the conscious subject to be aware of itself as a subject for whom something other, an object, is presented as something known. Hegel goes beyond Kant, however, in making this requirement dependent on the recognition of other consciousnesses. In short, one's self-consciousness comes about only indirectly via recognising another conscious subject's recognition of oneself! It is in this way the Phenomenology now changes course, the earlier tracking of "shapes of consciousness" being effectively replaced by the tracking of distinct patterns of mutual recognition.
It is in this way that Hegel has effected the transition from a phenomenology of "subjective spirit" to one of objective spirit -- culturally distinct patterns of social interaction analysed in terms of the patterns of recognition they embody. But this is only worked out in the text gradually. We, the reading "phenomenological we" can see how the type of religious self-consciousness ("unhappy consciousness") with which ch 4 ends, is a form of consciousness that depends on certain sorts of cultural institutions. the protagonist consciousness has to undergo further learning, however, in chapter 5, "Reason" before objective spirit can become the explicit subject of chapter 6, (Spirit).
Hegel's discussion of spirit starts from what he calls "Sittlichkeit", translated as "ethical order" or "ethical substance", a nominalisation from the adjectival (or adverbial) sittlich, "customary", from the stem "Sitte" -- "custom" or "convention". Thus Hegel might be seen as adopting the viewpoint that as social life is ordered by customs we can approach it in terms of the patterns of those customs or conventions themselves -- the rule-governed practices, as it were, of specific forms of life. It is not surprising then that his account of spirit here starts with a discussion of religious and civic law. Undoubtedly it is this tendency to use such renominalisations of abstract concepts in attempt to capture something concrete such as actual patterns of conventional life, together with the tendency to personify, as in talking about "spirit" becoming "self-conscious" that gives plausibility to the traditionalist understanding of Hegel. But for non-traditionalists it is not obvious that Hegel is committed to any metaphysical supra-individual conscious beings. In the second section of the chapter on spirit Hegel discusses "culture" as the "world of self-alienated spirit". That is, human in societies not only act and interact, they create relatively enduring cultural products (stories, dramas, and so forth) within which they can see their own patterns of life reflected. We might find intelligible the idea that such products "hold up a mirror to society" within which "the society can regard itself", without thinking we are thereby committed to some supra-individual social "mind" achieving self-consciousness. In the final section of Spirit, Hegel discusses forms of moral life. From Hegel's point of view, the capacity to adopt the type of objective viewpoint demanded by Kantian morality, for example, depends on the ability to see things, as it were, from a "universal" point of view, that is, a point of view akin to that hitherto implicitly adopted in engaging with spirit's "alienations".
We might think that if Kant had written the Phenomenology, he would have ended it at chapter 6 with the moral subject as the telos of the story. For Kant, the practical knowledge of morality exceeds the scope of theoretical knowledge which had been limited to appearances. Hegel, however, thought that philosophy had to unify theoretical and practical knowledge. Again, this is seen differently by traditionalists and revisionists. For traditionalists, Chapters 7, "Religion" and 8, "Absolute Knowing" (philosophy), testify to Hegel's disregard for Kant's critical limitation of theoretical knowledge to empirical experience. Revisionists, on the other hand, tend to see Hegel as furthering the Kantian critique into the very meaningfulness of a conception of an "in-itself" reality theoretical (but not practical) knowledge of which is denied. Rather than understand "absolute knowing" as an account of the recipe for the acquisition of some ultimate "God's-eye view" of the everything, the philosophical analogue to the knowledge of God sought in religion, revisionists see it as the accession to a mode of self-critical thought that has finally abandoned all non-questionable givens but which will only countenance reason-giving argument as justifications. However we understand this, absolute knowing is the standpoint that Hegel has hoped to bring the reader to in this complex work. This is the "standpoint of science", the standpoint from which philosophy proper commences, and it commences in Hegel's next book, the Science of Logic.
A glance at the table of contents of Science of Logic reveals the same triadic structuring noted in the Phenomenology. At the highest level of its branching structure there are three "books", devoted to the doctrines of "being", "essence", and "concept" respectively. In turn, each book has three sections, each section containing three chapters, and so on. In general each of these nodes deals with some particular category or "thought determination", sometimes the first subheading under a higher node having the same name as the node itself. (To some extent, the treatment of the syllogism found in book three is meant to provide a retrospective justification for this structuring, Hegel's idea being that all rigorous thought about anything must grasp it in terms of the fundamental thought determinations of "singularity", "particularity", and "universality". This pattern, then, will be reproduced in rigorous thought about thought itself -- the science of logic.)
Reading into the first chapter of book one, "Being", it is quickly seen that the Logic repeats the movements of the first chapters of the Phenomenology, now, however, at the level of "thought" rather than conscious experience. Thus "being" is the thought determination that the work commences with because it at first seems to be the most "immediate", fundamental determination characterising any possible thought content at all. It has no internal structure (in the way that "bachelor" say has a structure containing further concepts "male" and "unmarried") nor reference to anything beyond itself (in the way that "male", say, has an external contrast with "female"). Again parallel to the Phenomenology, it is the effort of thought to make such a contents explicit that both undermines it and brings about a new content. "Being" seems "immediate" but reflection reveals that it itself is only meaningful in opposition to another concept, "nothing". In fact, the attempt to think "being" as immediate and so as deprived of all determinacy that it might receive by reference to opposing concepts (like "nothing") so empties it that it becomes nothing. Being and nothing seem both absolutely distinct and yet the same, but out of this puzzle a third category suggests itself, "becoming" which seems to save thinking from collapse. When something "becomes" it is, as it were, moving between nothingness and being.
In general this is how the text proceeds: seeking its most basic and universal determination, thought raises a presupposed category to become an object or content of thought itself, finds then that it collapses due to some contradiction generated, but then finds a further category which makes retrospective sense of that contradiction. This new category is more complex as it has internal structure in the way that "being" and "nothing" are "moments" of becoming. But it in turn generates contradictions which bring about some further concept of which it is revealed to be a moment. In this way the categorial infrastructure to thought is unpacked with the resources available to thought itself, its capacity to make its contents determinate and its refusal to tolerate contradiction.
But Hegel's logic is not a formal logic, it does not simply reveal the form of our thoughts about some separate content, is also an ontology, it is the science of that content, "actuality", as well. (Thus it is not just about the concepts "being", "nothing", "becoming" and so on, but about being, nothing becoming and so on.) What we must recognise here is Hegel's radically non-representationalist (and in some sense "direct realist") understanding of thought. The world is not represented in thought, but rather presented or made manifest in it. To think that what is manifest in thought is only an appearance "for us" of some separate "in itself" reality is to fall back into the well-known contradictions of Kant's dichotomy. (We might think here of Kant affirming of the "in itself" its simple "being" because nothing more can be known of it; but this very affirmation would immediately "suck" the in-itself into the Hegelian categorial holism.)
This coincidence of logic and ontology is, of course, regarded by the traditionalists as being at the heart of Hegel's metaphysical idealism. Reality is ultimately made up of thought determinations because it is ultimately mental: it is the reality of a self-conceiving absolute spirit -- God. Nothing looks more like confirming this picture than the treatment of "syllogisms" in the third book, "the doctrine of concept".
The thought determinations of book one had eventually led into those of book two, "The Doctrine of Essence". Naturally the structures implicit in "essence" thinking are more developed than those of "being" thinking. (Crucially, the contrasting pair "essence" and "appearance" allow the thought of some underlying reality which manifests itself through a different overlying appearance, a relation not captureable in the simpler "being" structures.) As Hegel's logic is ontological its various stages are meant to coincide roughly with actual theories encountered in a history of metaphysics. Thus the metaphysics of Parmenides and Heraclitus, for example, line up with the thought determinations "being" and "becoming" at the beginning of Being-logic while Essence-logic culminates concepts bound up with modern forms of substance metaphysics as is found in Spinoza and Leibniz.
Book three "The Doctrine of Concept" effects a shift from the "Objective Logic" of books 1 and 2, to "Subjective Logic", and metaphysically represents a shift to modern subject-based ontologies such as are found after Kant. Just as Kantian philosophy is founded on conceptually generated objectivity, Concept-logic commences with the concept of concept itself! While in the two books of objective logic, the movement was between particular concepts, "being", "nothing", "becoming" etc., in the subjective logic, the conceptual relations are grasped at a meta-level, such that the concept "concept" treated in chapter one of section one ("Subjectivity") passes over into that of "judgment" in chapter two, as judgments are the larger wholes in which concepts themselves get related to each other. When Hegel's anti-foundationalism and holism of the Phenomenology is recalled, it will come as no surprise that the concept of judgment passes over into that of "syllogism": for Hegel just as a concept gains its determinacy in the context of judgments within which it is applied, so too do judgements gain their determinacy within larger patterns of inference.
With the discussion of syllogistic inference, the reader might think that Hegel has finally started to address logical issues, but after a discussion of various types of syllogism loosely modelled on Aristotle's approach, Hegel asserts that the syllogism has become concrete and "pregnant with content" and has necessary existence, and Section 1 of book 3 passes over into Section 2, dealing with "objectivity". Traditionalists will here see something akin to the "ontological argument" in that the existence of something seems to have been necessitated by its concept, in Hegel's version the objective existence of God being necessitated by his essential self-consciousness. But even here non-traditional readings might be put forward bound up with Hegel's rigorous anti-representationalism. Like recent "externalists" on mental content, Hegel, it might be argued, simply sees the contents of judgments and syllogisms as configurations of worldly things. In fact, Hegel had used the concept of "syllogism" to capture the structure of those recognitive interactions he was concerned with in the Phenomenology. In section 3 ("The Idea") of the third book of the Logic, we might see Hegel trying to grapple with the notion of rational objectivities, that is, conceptualising, judging and inferring human beings within those recognitive forms of community which constitute the conditions of such activities.
First published: February 13, 1997
Content last modified: August 3, 1997