Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
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Snark
Snarks are a species of bandersnatch. They are
thought to have evolved from the slithy toves along with the other
bandersnatches. Snarks were common in New England forests until the
late 19th century, when it was thought that they were hunted to
extinction. Recent ethological expeditions, however, have uncovered
evidence that there may be a few extant individuals. Snarks are
favorites with animal lovers everywhere because in the spring, they
gyre and gimble on small ponds in a brilliant mating display. In
reference works on bandersnatches, snarks are referred to as a group
by the Latin name Snarkidae.
Snarks are a species of bandersnatch and are
thought to have evolved from the slithy toves along with the other
bandersnatches. Snarks evolved in the Devonian period and
successfully adapted themselves in several ecological niches until the
late 19th century. The fact that they have a dorsal sigmoid bone
establishes their descent from the slithy toves.
Snarks bear young just at the point in early summer when their food
source is most abundant. Their biological clocks are very well tuned
and biologists study them as the principal model of such clocks in the
animal kingdom.
There is nothing like the wonder and pageantry of snarks in mating
season, as they gyre and gimble on the ponds of New England forests.
- Doe, J., "The Ecological Range of the Snark," Ecology
Today 3/1 (January 1992): 15-30
- Dodgson, C., "The Origins of Bandersnatches," Annals of
the Society for the Investigation of the Descendents of the
Slithy Toves XL (1993): 1-20
bandersnatch | gyration | toves
Copyright © 1996, 1997 by
Charles Dodgson
dodgson@alice.uwonderland.edu
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Table of Contents
First published: January 20, 1996
Content last modified: May 15, 1997