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From these sources, scholars have attempted to piece together a picture of the content, and in some cases, the development of Stoic doctrine. In some areas, there is a fair bit of consensus about what the Stoics thought and we can even attach names to some particular innovations. However, in other areas the proper interpretation of our meagre evidence is hotly contested. Until recently, non-specialists have been largely excluded from the debate because many important source were not translated into modern languages. Fragments of Stoic works and testimonia in their original Greek and Latin were collected into a three-volume set in 1903-5 by H. von Arnim, entitled Stoicorum Veterum Fragmenta. In writings on the Stoics, fragments and testimonia are still often referred to by von Arnim's volume numbers and text numeration; e.g. SVF I.345 = Diogenes Laertius, Lives 4.40. In 1987, A. A. Long and David Sedley brought out the first volume of The Hellenistic Philosophers which contains English translations and commentary of many important texts on Stoics, Epicureans and Skeptics. In what follows, I will refer to texts by or about Stoics using Long and Sedley's notation, i.e. 47G = section 47 of their work, text G, unless otherwise specifically noted.
In accord with this ontology, the Stoics, like the Epicureans, make God material. But while the Epicureans think the Gods are too busy being blessed and happy to be bothered with the governance of the universe, the Stoic God is immanent throughout the whole of creation and directs its development down to the smallest detail. God is identical with one of the two ungenerated and indestructible first principles (archai) of the universe. One principle is matter which is they regard as utterly unqualified and inert. It is that which is acted upon. God is identified with an eternal reason (logos, 44B ) or intelligent designing fire (46A) which structures matter in accordance with It's plan. This plan is enacted time and time again, beginning from a state in which all is fire, through the generation of the elements, to the creation of the world we are familiar and eventually back to fire in a cycle of endless recurrence. The designing fire of the conflagration is likened to a sperm which contains the principles or stories of all the things which will subsequently develop (46G). Under this guise, God is also called `fate.' It is important to realise that the Stoic God does not craft its world in accordance with its plan from the outside, as the demiurge in Plato's Timaeus (seemingly) does. Rather, God is the universe and it's history is determined by God's internal activity. The biological conception of God as a kind of living heat or seed from which things grow seems to be fully intended.
The first thing to develop from the conflagration are the elements. Of the four elements, the Stoics identify two as active (fire and air) and two as passive (water and earth). The active elements, or at least the principles of hot and cold, combine to form breath or pneuma. Pneuma, in turn, is the sustaining cause of all existing bodies and guides the growth and development of animate bodies. What is a sustaining cause? The Stoics think that the universe is a plenum. Like Aristotle, they reject the existence of empty space or void (except that universe as a whole is surrounded by it). Thus, one might reasonably ask, `What keeps an object from simply falling apart as it rubs elbows with other things in the crowd?' Within pneuma, there is a simultaneous movement inward and outward which gives it tension. (Perhaps this was suggested by the expansion and contraction associated with heat and cold.) Pneuma passes through all bodies and in its outward motion gives them the qualities that they have, and in its inward motion makes them unified objects (47J). In this respect, pneuma plays something of the role of substantial form in Aristotle for this too makes the thing of which it is the form both `some this', i.e. an individual, and `what it is' (Metaph. VII, 17). Because pneuma acts, it must be a body and it appears that the Stoics stressed the fact that it's blending with matter is `through and through' (47H, 48C). Perhaps as a result of this, they developed a theory of mixture which allowed for two bodies to be in the same place at the same time.
Pneuma comes in gradations and endows the bodies which it pervades with different qualities as a result. The pneuma which sustains an inanimate object is called tenor (hexis). Pneuma in plants is physique (phusis). In animals, pneuma gets called soul (psychê) and in rational animals the pneuma is the commanding faculty (hegemenikon). The Stoic account of the human soul is strongly monistic. Though they speak of the soul's faculties, these are parts of the commanding faculty associated with the physical sense organs. Unlike the Platonic tri-partite soul, all impulses or desires are functions of the rational part of the soul. This strongly monistic conception of the human soul has serious implications for Stoic epistemology and ethics. In the first case, our impressions of sense are affections of the commanding faculty. In rational animals, these impressions are thoughts, or representations with propositional content. Though the agent may have no choice about whether she has a particular rational impression, there is another power of the commanding faculty which the Stoics call `assent' and whether one assents to a rational impression is a matter of volition. To assent to an impression is to take its content as true. To withhold assent is to suspend judgement about whether it is true. Because both impression and assent are part of one and the same commanding faculty, there can be no conflict between separate and distinct rational and irrational elements within oneself—a fight which reason might lose. Compare this situation with Plato's description of the conflict between the inferior soul within us which is taken in by sensory illusions and the calculating part which is not (Rep. X, 602E). There is no reason to think that the calculating part can always win the civil war which Plato imagines to take place within us. But because the impression and assent are both aspects of one and the same soul according to the Stoics, they think that it is possible that we can always avoid falling into error if only our reason is sufficiently disciplined. In a similar fashion, impulses or desires are movements of the soul toward something. In a rational creature, these are exercises of the rational faculty which do not arise without assent. Thus, it might be thought that the movement of the soul toward X is automatically consequent upon the impression that X is desirable. Indeed, this is just what the Stoic's opponents, the Skeptics, argue (69A.) The Stoics, however, claim that there will be no impulse—much less an action—toward X unless one assents to the impression (53S). The upshot of this is that all desires are not only (at least potentially) under the control of reason, they are acts of reason. Thus, there could be no gap between forming the judgement that one ought to do X and desiring to do X.
Since pneuma is a body, there is a sense in which the Stoics have a materialist theory of mind. The pneuma which is a person's soul is subject to generation and destruction (53 C, W). Unlike the Epicureans, however, it does not follow from this that my soul will be destroyed at the time at which my body dies. Chrysippus alleged that the souls of the wise would not perish until the next conflagration (SVF 2.811, not in LS). Is this simply a failure of nerve on the part of an otherwise thorough-going materialist? Recall that the distinctive movement of pneuma is its simultaneous inward and outward motion. It is this which makes it tensile and capable of preserving, organising and, in some cases, animating the bodies which it interpenetrates. The Stoics equate virtue with wisdom and both with a kind of firmness or tensile strength within the commanding faculty of the soul (41H, 61B, 65T). Perhaps the thought was that the souls of the wise had a sufficient tensile strength that they could subsist as a distinct body on their own.
The Stoics express their commitment to casual determinism in a potentially misleading way. They treat the claim that `all things happen through antecedent causes' as an alternative formulation of the claim that `all things happen through fate' (kath heimarmenên). But, in fact, the Stoics do not accept the doctrine that modern philosophers call fatalism. The matter is doubly confused, because the modern arguments for fatalism often emerge from the very considerations about bivalence that Aristotle discusses in On Interpretation. The classic example is Richard Taylor's argument in Metaphysics (2nd edition, Englewood Cliffs, NJ, 1974). One way to see the difference between fatalism and Chrysippus' causal determinism, is to ask, `What makes it the case that we won't have a sea battle tomorrow?' The causal determinist can say, `The lack of wind' or perhaps even `Our decision not to go out and fight' and these things could all have been different, if only things had been different at some earlier time. The fatalist responds that what makes it the case that we will not fight tomorrow is the fact that the proposition `There will not be a sea battle on such and such a date' has always been true. Much turns on what one says about the modal status of this truth. Diodorus Chronus, against whom Chrysippus argues, claimed that truths about the past are necessary: it is not merely that they aren't other than they are, they can't be other than they are, for we have no power to change the past (38A). He also claimed that what is impossible does not follow from what is possible. In the so-called Master Argument, he attempted to show that these two theses were incompatible with the claim that there is something which is possible, but yet does not happen. The details of the Master Argument are a matter of much dispute. We know that it was alleged to show that these three propositions formed an inconsistent triad, but exactly how it did this remains uncertain. We also know that Diodorus' manner of resolving this inconsistency was to reject that latter and to define the possible as that which is or will be the case. Now consider our sea battle which will not take place tomorrow. If `there will be a sea battle on such and such a date' is not true and will not be true, then by Diodorus' lights, it is impossible! (38C). Chrysippus felt the need to preserve the thesis that there are things which are possible but which do not happen. Toward this end, he rejected the proposition that what is impossible does not follow from what is possible with the following example: consider the conditional `if Dion is dead, then this one is dead' when ostensive reference is being made to Dion. The antecedent is possible, since Dion will one day be dead. However, the consequent is impossible since one cannot make the requisite ostensive reference to a dead man so as to make it true that `this one [i.e. the man I'm pointing to] is dead', for a dead man isn't a man (38F). On the surface this appears utterly ad hoc. While it is clearly wrong, given the Stoics' views about `sayables' (lekta), it is exactly the response that they should make and once again simply illustrates the systematic character of Stoic philosophy.
With respect to language, the Stoics distinguish between the signification, the signifier and the name bearer. Two of these are bodies: the signifier which is the utterance and the name bearer which gets signified. The signification, however, is an incorporeal thing called a lekton, or `sayable', and it, not the other two, is what is true or false (33B). They define a sayable as `that which subsists in accordance with a rational impression.' Rational impressions are those alterations of the commanding faculty whose content can be exhibited in language. Presumably `graphei Sôcratês ' and `Socrates writes' exhibit the contents of one and the same rational impression in different languages. At first glance, this looks very like a modern theory of propositions. But propositions (axiômata) are only one subspecies of sayables. They also include questions and commands on the one hand, and, in a category of sayables called `incomplete', the Stoics include predicates and incomplete expressions like he/she/it writes (33F). An incomplete sayable like `writes' gets transformed into a proposition by being attached to a nominative case (ptôsis, 33G). One might expect a case to be the reference of a proper name or a noun, e.g. Socrates or the man, but it seems to mean the inflected word, `Socrates' or `ho anthrôpos'—the nominative case of the Greek word `man'. The Stoic doctrine of case is one of those areas where there is as yet little consensus. Stoic propositions are unlike contemporary theories of propositions in another way too: Stoic sayables are not timelessly true or false. If it is now daytime, the lekton corresponding to the utterance `it is day' is true. Tonight, however, it will be false (34F). Finally, the Stoic theory gives a certain kind of priority to propositions involving demonstratives. `This one is writing' is definite, while `someone is writing' is indefinite. Strangely, `Socrates is writing' is said to be intermediate between these two. The reasons for this are not clear, though they may be connected with the mysterious business of case (34K). When there is a failure of reference, the Stoics say that the lekton is destroyed and this is supposed to provide the reason why `this one is dead' (spoken in relation to Dion) is impossible.
Perhaps the most famous topic considered under the Stoic heading of logic is the matter of the criterion of truth and their disputes with the skeptical New Academy about it. According to Chrysippus, the criterion of truth is the cognitive impression (phantasia kataplêptikê, 40A). A criterion or canon of truth is an instrument for determining what is true and the Hellenistic schools all provide some view on how it is that we are to measure or evaluate whether something is true or not. The Stoic's cognitive impression is an impression which `arises from that which is; is stamped and impressed in accordance with that very thing; and of such a kind as could not arise from what is not' (40E). Recall that among the powers of the commanding faculty is the capacity to assent or withhold assent to impressions. The fact that it is always within our power to withhold assent means that if we are sufficiently disciplined, we are capable of always avoiding error. In itself, it does not mean that we are capable of attaining knowledge, for there might not be any impressions that one can be confident in assenting to. The cognitive impression was supposed to fill that role. It is an impression which is such that, when one has it, one may be confident that it reveals a truth about the world. In this respect it is exactly like basic or self-justifying beliefs which foundationalists think lie at the base of all our knowledge. However, the Stoics are not content to say that the mere having of a cognitive impression is knowledge. Indeed, they don't even think that assent to such an impression amounts to knowledge: this is only cognition or grasp (katalêpsis). Real knowledge (epistêmê) is cognition which is secure, firm and unchangeable by reason (41C). Weak and changeable assent to a cognitive impressions results only in ignorance. (It is not entirely clear where opinion stands in this categorisation. Most Stoic sources define it as `assent to the incognitive', but some suggest that changeable assent to a cognitive impression might still count as opinion.) In any event, there is an absolute distinction between the wise and the ignorant. Only the Stoic sage's assent to cognitive impressions counts as knowledge for only she has the proper discipline to avoid assenting to things that she shouldn't. The Stoics call this epistemic virtue `non-precipitancy' (aproptôsia) and it underlies their claim that the Stoic sage never makes mistakes (41D).
The Skeptics responded by denying the existence of cognitive impressions. According to Arcesilaus, `no impression arising from something true is such that an impression arising from something false could not be just like it' (40D). We can distinguish two general lines of attack. First, the Skeptics point to cases of insanity. In his madness, Heracles had the impression that his children were, in fact, the children of his enemy Eurystheus and killed them. Since the impression must have been utterly convincing to him at the time at which he had it (judging by his subsequent action), it is clear from this that there can be false impressions which are indistinguishable from cognitive ones (41H). Their second line of attack was to draw attention to objects which are so similar as to be indistinguishable. The story is related that the Stoic philosopher Sphaerus was tricked into thinking that wax pomegranates were real. This was again supposed to show that there could be impressions arising from what is not [sc. a pomegranate] which are indistinguishable from a cognitive impression. The Stoics met these arguments by first pointing out that Heracles' inability to distinguish cognitive from incognitive impressions in his madness says nothing about the capacities of normal human beings. Their response to the second line of attack was two-fold. The first is a metaphysically motivated answer: if any two objects really were indistinguishable, they would be identical. This doctrine has come to be known as the identity if indiscernibles. They also replied that the Stoic sage would withhold assent in cases where things are too similar to be confident that one had it right (40I).
In some ways, the Stoics have an easier time with Skeptical objections than modern foundationalists do. At bottom what the Stoics are committed to is the two-fold view that it is within our power to avoid falling into error and that there is a kind of impression which is reveals to us the world as it really is and which is distinguishable from those impressions which might not so reveal the world. They are manifestly not committed to defending our ordinary intuitions about the range of knowledge: that most people in fact know most of the things that they and everyone else thinks that they know. The only person with knowledge is the Stoic sage and these are as rare as the phoenix (61N). Everyone else is equally ignorant. This absolute distinction between the wise and the ignorant is a consequence of the Stoic definition of knowledge as the `cognition which is secure and unchangeable by reason' (41H). Either one's cognition is like this or it is not. By making opinion a kind of ignorance (cf. Plato, Rep. 474a ff), they do not allow room for an intermediate state between the wise man and all the rest of us.
It might be thought that the doctrine of the cognitive impression introduces a form of the KK thesis—knowledge is such that someone who knows that P also knows that he knows that P—and this is a difficult doctrine to defend. But it is not clear that this is so. Cognition (the assent to a cognitive impression) in ordinary folks is not knowledge because it is not firm. I might be talked out of my assent to the impression that there is a dagger in front of me by a smooth talking skeptic who gives me fanciful stories about drugs in my morning coffee. Only a sage, whose assent is immune to change, could be said to know that there is a dagger and to know that she knows this. (Presumably this is why she can't be talked out of her assent.) But this is just to say that nature provides the conditions for the possibility of a strong foundationalism: the capacity for assent and the cognitive impression. It is not to claim that the doxastic structure of the ordinary ignoramus (that is, all of us—at least by Stoic standards!) can be interpreted in such a way as to conform to that of the strong foundationalist ideal.
A bit of reflection tells us that the goal that we all have is happiness or flourishing (eudaimônia). But what is happiness? The Epicureans' answer was quite straightforward: the happy life is the one which is most pleasant. (But it needs to be said that their account what the highest pleasure consists in was much less simple.) Cleanthes' formulation of the end was `living in accordance with nature' (63B). Later Stoics amplified this formulation the `rational selection of the primary things according to nature'. Once again, we confront the systematic nature of Stoic philosophy. Their specification of what happiness consists in cannot be understood apart from their views about value and human psychology.
A better way into the thicket of Stoic ethics might be through the question of what is good, for all parties agree that possession of what is genuinely good secures a person's happiness. The Stoics claim that whatever is good must benefit its possessor under all circumstances. But there are situations in which it is not to my benefit to be healthy or wealthy. (We may imagine that if I had money I would spend it on heroin which would not benefit me.) Thus, things like money are simply not good, in spite of what nearly everyone thinks, and the Stoics call them `indifferents' (58A). The only things which are good are the characteristic excellences or virtues of human beings: prudence or wisdom, justice, courage and moderation. But the Stoics are not such lovers of paradox that they are willing to say that my preference for wealth over poverty in most circumstances is utterly groundless. They draw a distinction between what is good and things which have value (axia). Some indifferent things, like health or wealth, are to be preferred and have value, even if they are not good, because they are appropriate, fitting or suitable (oikeios) for us.
Impulse, as noted above, is a movement of the soul toward an object. Though these movements are subject to the capacity for assent in fully rational creatures, impulse is present with all animate things from the moment of birth. The Stoics argue that the primary impulse of ensouled creatures is toward what is appropriate for them, or aids in their self-preservation, and not toward what is pleasurable, as the Epicureans contend. Because the whole of the world is identical with the fully rational creature which is God, each part of it is naturally constituted so that it seeks what is appropriate or suitable to it, just as our own body parts are so constituted so as to preserve both themselves and the whole of which they are parts. The Stoic doctrine of appropriateness (oikeiôsis) thus provides a foundation in nature for an objective ordering of preferences, at least on a prima facie basis. Other things being equal, it is objectively preferable to have health rather than sickness. The Stoics call things whose preferability is overridden only in very rare circumstances `things according to nature'. As we mature, we discover new things which are according to our natures. As infants perhaps we only recognised that food and warmth are appropriate to us, but since humans are rational, more than these basic necessities are appropriate to us. One of the aspects of the Greek term `oikeion' is that it can mean not only what is suitable, but also what is akin to oneself, standing in a natural relation of affection. Thus, my blood relatives are—or least ought to be— oikeioi. It is partly in this sense that we eventually come to the recognition—or at least ought to—that other people, insofar as they are rational, are appropriate to me. I suspect that Cicero's quotation of Terence's line `nothing human is alien to me' in the context of On Duties I.30 echoes this thought. More generally, the unfolding of God's providential plan is rational through and through, so that in some sense what will in fact happen is appropriate to me.
When we take the rationality of the world order into consideration, we can begin to understand the Stoic formulations of the goal or end. `Living in accordance with nature' presumably is meant to work at a variety of levels. Since my nature is such that health and wealth are appropriate to me, other things being equal, I ought to choose them. Hence the formulations of the end by later Stoics stress idea happiness consists in the rational selection of the things according to nature. But, we must bear in mind an important caveat here. Health and wealth are not the only things which are appropriate to me. So are other rational beings and it would be irrational to choose one thing which is appropriate to me without due consideration of the effect of that choice on other things which are appropriate to me. This is why the later formulations stress that happiness consists in the rational selection of the things according to nature. But if I am faced with a choice between increasing my wealth (something which is prima facie appropriate to my nature) and preserving someone else's health (which is something appropriate to something which is appropriate to me), which course of action is the rational one? The Stoic response is that it is the one which is ultimately both natural and rational: that is, the one that is fated to come about in the unfolding of nature's rational and providential plan. Living in accord with nature in this sense can even demand that I select things which are not appropriate to my nature—at least when that nature is considered in isolation from these particular circumstances. Here Chrysippus' remark about what his foot would will if it were conscious is apposite.
`As long as the future is uncertain to me I always hold to those things which are better adapted to obtaining the things in accordance with nature; for God himself has made me disposed to select these. But if I actually knew that I was fated now to be ill, I would even have an impulse to be ill. For my foot too, if it had intelligence, would have an impulse to get muddy.' (58J)
We too, as rational parts of rational nature, ought to choose in accordance with what will in fact happen since this is wholly good and rational.
So far the emphasis has been on just one component of the Stoic formulation of the goal or end of life: it is the `rational selection of the things according to nature.' The other thing that needs to be stressed is that it is rational selection—not the attainment—of these things which constitutes happiness. Even though the things according to nature have a kind of value (axia) which grounds the rationality of preferring them (other things being equal), this kind of value is still not goodness. From the point of view of happiness, the things according to nature are still indifferent. What matters for our happiness is whether we choose them rationally and, as it turns out, this means choosing them in accordance with virtue. Surely one motive for this is the rejection of even the limited role that external goods and fortune play in the Aristotelian ethics. According to the Peripatetics, the happy life is one in which one exercises one's moral and theoretical virtues. But one can't exercise a moral virtue like liberality (Nich Eth IV.1) without some money. The Stoics, by contrast, claim that so long as I order my preferences in accordance with my nature and universal nature, I will be happy and virtuous, even if I do not actually get the things I prefer. Though these things are appropriate to me, rational choice is even more appropriate or akin to me, and so long as I have that, then I have perfected my nature. The perfection of one's rational nature is the condition of being virtuous and it is this, and this alone, which is good.
How do these general considerations about the goal of living translate into an evaluation of actions? When I perform an action accords with my nature and for which a good reason can be given, then I perform what the Stoics call a `proper function' (kathêkon, 59B). It is important to note that non-rational animals perform proper functions as well. This shows how much importance is placed upon the idea of what accords with one's nature or, in another formulation, `activity which is consequential upon a thing's nature.' It also shows the gap between proper functions and morally right actions, for the Stoics, like most contemporary philosophers, think that animals cannot act morally or immorally.
Most proper functions are directed toward securing things which are appropriate to nature. Thus, if I take good care of my body, then this is a proper function. They divide proper functions into those which do not depend upon circumstances and those that do. Taking care of one's health is among the former, while mutilating oneself is among the latter (59E). It appears that this is an attempt to work out a set of prima facie duties based upon our natures. Other things being equal, looking after one's health is a course of action which accords with one's nature and thus is one for which a reason can be given. However, there are circumstances in which a better reason can be given for mutilating oneself—for instance, if this is the only way you can prevent Fagin from compelling you to steal for him.
Since both ordinary people and Stoic wise men look after their health except in very extraordinary circumstances both the sage and the ordinary person perform proper functions. A proper function becomes a right action (katorthôma) only when it is perfected or done virtuously. In the tradition of Socratic moral theory, the Stoics regard the virtues as knowledge or science within the soul. Thus a specific virtue like moderation is defined as `the science (epistêmê) of what should be chosen and avoided and of neutral situations' (61H). More broadly, virtue is `an expertise concerned with the whole of life' (61E). Like other forms of knowledge, virtues are characters of the soul's commanding faculty which are firm and unchangeable. The other similarity with Socratic ethics is that the Stoics think that the virtues are either really just one state of soul or, at least, inter-entailing (61B on Aristo, 61C-F for Chrysippus' more orthodox position). On either account, no one can be moderate without also being just, courageous and prudent as well. When someone who has all the virtues performs a proper function, he performs it in accordance with virtue or virtuously and this transforms into a right action or a perfect function. The connection here is almost analytic in Greek ethical theorising. Virtues just are those features which make a thing a good thing of its kind or allow it to perform its function well. So, actions done in accordance with virtue are actions which are done well. The Stoics draw the conclusion from this that the wise (and therefore virtuous) person does everything within the scope of moral action well (61G). This makes it seem far less strange to say that virtue is sufficient for happiness. Furthermore, because virtue is a kind of knowledge and there is no cognitive state between knowledge and ignorance, those who are not wise do everything equally badly. Strictly speaking, there is no such thing as moral progress for the Stoics and they give the charming illustration of drowning to make their point: a person an arm's length from the surface is drowning every bit as surely as one who is five hundred fathoms down (61T).
We are finally in a position to understand and evaluate the Stoic view on emotions since it is a consequence of their views on the soul and the good. It is perhaps more accurate to call it the Stoic view of the passions, though this is a somewhat dated term. The passions or pathê are literally `things which one undergoes' and are to be contrasted with actions or things that one does. Thus, the view that one should be apathetic, in its original Hellenistic sense, is not the view that you shouldn't care about anything, but rather the view that you should not be subject to anything and connotes a kind of complete self-sufficiency. The Stoics distinguish two primary passions: appetite and fear. These arise in relation to what appears to us to be good or bad. They are associated with two other passions: pleasure and distress. These result when we get or fail to avoid the objects of the first two passions. What distinguishes these states of soul from normal impulses is that they are excessive impulses which are disobedient to reason. Part of what is meant by this is that one's fear of dogs may not go away with the rational recognition that this blind, 16 year old, 3 legged Yorkshire terrier poses no threat to you. But this is not all. The Stoics call a passion like distress a fresh opinion that something bad is present. Recall that opinion is assent to a false impression. Given the Stoic's view about good and bad, the only time that one should assent to the impression that something bad is present is when there is something which might threaten one's virtue, for this and this alone is good. Thus all passions involve an element of false judgement. But these are false judgements which are inseparable from physiological changes in the pneuma which constitutes one's commanding faculty. The Stoics describe these changes as shrinkings or swellings, and part of the reason that they locate the commanding faculty in the heart is because this seems to be where the physical sensations which accompany passions like fear are manifested. This is why passions are called fresh opinions (65B). Such an addition is surely necessary to give their theory any plausibility. From the inside a judgement—even one like `this impending dog bite will be bad'—just doesn't feel like fear.
Another obvious objection to the Stoic theory is that someone who fears, say pigeons, may not think that they are dangerous. We say that she knows rationally that pigeons are harmless but that she has an irrational fear. It might be thought that in such a case, the judgement which the Stoics think is essential to the passion is missing. Here they resort to the idea that a passion is a fluttering of the commanding faculty. At one instant my commanding faculty judges (rightly) that this pigeon is not dangerous, but an instant later assents to the impression that it is and from this assent flows the excessive impulse away from the pigeon which is my fear. This switch of assent occurs repeatedly and rapidly so that it appears that one has the fear without the requisite judgement but in fact you are making it and taking it back during the time you undergo the passion (65G).
It is important to bear in mind that the Stoics do not think that all impulses are to be done away with. What distinguishes normal impulses or desires from passions is the idea that the latter are excessive and irrational. Galen provides a nice illustration of the difference (65J). Suppose I want to run, or, in the Stoic's terminology, I have an impulse to run. If I go running down a sharp incline I may be unable to stop or change direction in response to a new impulse. My running is excessive in relation to my initial impulse. Passions are distinguished from normal impulses in much the same way: they have a kind of momentum which carries one beyond the dictates of reason. If, for instance, you are consumed with lust (a passion falling under appetite), you might not do what you yourself would judge to be the sensible thing under other circumstances.
Even in antiquity the Stoics were ridiculed for their views on the passions. Some critics called them the men of stone. But this is not entirely fair, for the Stoics allow that the sage will experience what they call the good feelings (eupatheia, 65F). These include joy, watchfulness and wishing and are distinguished from their negative counterparts (pleasure, fear and appetite) in being well-reasoned and not excessive. The species under wishing include kindness, generosity and warmth. A good feeling like kindness is a moderate and reasonable stretching or expansion of the soul presumably prompted by the correct judgement that other rational beings are appropriate to oneself.
First published: April 15, 1996
Content last modified: April 15, 1996