This is a file in the archives of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.

Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Fall 1997 Edition

Entry Guidelines

HTML

Because the Encyclopedia is being served over the World Wide Web, all entries must be written in HTML (HyperText Markup Language). This is the formatting language that controls the way text, graphics, and links are displayed in Web browsers. There are now available numerous HTML Editors and Web Authoring Tools and these allow the authors to format text and graphics in HTML easily, without learning any arcane commands. To begin writing an entry, authors should download the sourcefile of the "Entry Template" (linked into the Editorial Information page) and open that file using an HTML Editor. This Entry Template will ensure that there is a uniform entry style. This style is described below, in the section on "Entry Format".

For those authors who prefer to create an HTML sourcefile directly, without the assistance of an HTML editor, we provide an "Annotated Sourcefile", which is also linked into the Editorial Information page. After downloading the source code, authors can replace the sample text in this file with their own content. This will minimize the number of HTML commands authors will need to learn.

Entry Format

The Entry Template and Annotated Sourcefile are formatted in HTML so that the following divisions are preserved in every entry: These are discussed in turn.

Introduction. The Introduction should contain a brief definition of the subject. This may take one or two paragraphs, and if possible, these paragraphs should contain some statement of the subject's interest and significance. The main topics to be covered in the body of the entry may be mentioned here, so that the reader will get some idea of what is to follow.

Internal Links. The internal links should be a list of the main sections of the entry, and each item in the list should be a link to that section. The HTML commands needed to do this are included in the template and in the annotated sourcefile.

Main Sections. The sectioning of the entry is at the discretion of the author. However, we encourage authors to include a Chronology or "Life" section in Biographical entries. Moreover, a "History" section is called for in the discussion of many topics.

Bibliography. Please use a standard bibliographic format, beginning with author's last names, and at least the initials of their first names. The format "City:Publisher, Date" is preferred to the "Publisher, Date" format.

Other Internet Resources. To complete this section, authors are encouraged to conduct an on-line search of the Web for related resources. In our experience, the best search engine for this purpose is Alta Vista, which can be found at:

http://altavista.digital.com/
Other search engines include www.lycos.com and www.yahoo.com. However, please do not create links to websites that are not maintained by qualified individuals.

Related Entries. Please list the names of the most important concepts and philosophers that occur in your entry. You may list keywords that do not appear as topics in our Table of Contents if you feel that they are important. We have a program which will notice the discrepancy and alert the Editor. A decision will be made whether or not to include a new entry on that topic. If we decide that the topic is too specialized or otherwise inappropriate for the Encyclopedia, we will eliminate this keyword from your list in the Related Entries section.

Content

The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy is intended to serve as an authoritative reference work suitable for use by professionals and students in the field of philosophy, as well as by all others interested in authoritative discussions on philosophical topics.

As a result, entries should address important philosophical topics, be written with the highest of professional standards, and be of interest to as wide an audience as possible. All entries should seek to provide objective, neutral analyses or surveys of particular topics or fields of inquiry, rather than promoting particular points of view.

The length of entries will typically be the equivalent of one to twenty printed pages, depending on the requirements of the topic, although exceptions to this guideline can certainly be made. Existing entries in the Encyclopedia may be consulted for style, content, and length.

Revision

Because the Encyclopedia is designed to be a living, growing document, all authors are responsible for maintaining and periodically updating their entries. Specifically, authors are requested to revise their entries in light of comments from members of the Editorial Board and to update them regularly in response to new developments in their respective field of research. In this way, unlike printed reference works or reference works on CD-ROM, the Encyclopedia will not go out of date.

Authors should begin the process of revision by: (1) notifying the Editor that you plan to make changes, and (2) downloading the present version of your entry from the Encyclopedia. You can download your entry either by using your browser to examine and download the file or by retrieving the file by ftp (`get' rather than `put' your file from the relevant subdirectory in your home directory). After after editing this file, it should then be ftp'ed back to the Encyclopedia. It is prudent to send the Editor a brief note ahead of time, indicating that you plan to transfer a new version of your entry because the Editor can warn you whether any editorial changes being made to the Encyclopedia make it an inopportune time to ftp updates to entries.

Footnotes

Footnotes may be included if necessary, though we do not encourage their use. The footnotes themselves should be put into a separate html file called "notes.html" and these should be placed into the same directory on plato.stanford.edu as the entry. To create links from the text to the footnotes, authors should follow these general guidelines. For footnote number "x", use the following HTML code at the point in the text where the footnote should occur:
<a href="notes.html#x"><sup>\x/</sup></a>
This will place "\x/" as a superscript in the text. Then, in "notes.html", begin footnote x with the following HTML code:
<p>
<a name="x">x.</a> [Body of footnote]
This will start a new paragraph and then mark the numeral-period combination "x." as the point in the footnotes page to which the text is linked. You need not put links back to the point of the footnote in the text, since users of the Encyclopedia can just use the "back" or "Return" button on their browsers to get back to the text. However, authors with knowledge of HTML may wish to include such a nicety.