Notes

2. This inverse tree-like structure was first noticed in the 3^rd century C.E. by Porphyry: “Substance is itself a genus, under this is body, and under body is living body, under which is animal. Under animal is rational animal, under which is man. Under man are Socrates and Plato and individual (kata meros) men” (Isagoge 4, 21-25). This so-called “tree of Porphyry” later found its way, with illustrations, into medieval discussions of Aristotle.

3. It is tempting to suppose (as Porphyry did, see note 2) that the name of each category picks out the most generic universal in that category, and that each category is thus a maximally general genus. (See also Owen 1965b.) Thus, e.g., substance might be supposed to be the genus under which fall the sub-genera plants and animals, along with all their lower-level genera and species. But there are good reasons to resist this temptation. For one thing, it would make the next-highest genera in a given category into species of that maximally general genus, and such species would have to be distinguished from one another by appropriate differentiae that would apply directly to each category itself to yield each of the species that fall directly under it. But there is no indication that Aristotle thought that there are such differentiae. Another problem with this supposition arises when one considers the union of all of these maximally general genera that constitute the categories. This would have to be a yet higher genus of which each category would be a species; and such a genus would contain everything that there is, in all of the categories. But this result seems to conflict with Aristotle’s fundamental tenet that being is not a genus (Posterior Analytics 92b14, Metaphysics B.3, 998b22).

An alternative view of the categories (suggested to me by Gareth B. Matthews) appeals to the fact that each category’s name derives from an interrogative: ‘quality’ from ‘like what?’, ‘quantity’ from ‘how much?’, ‘place’ from ‘where?’, etc. In the category of quality, then, we would find all of those things, arranged hierarchically from most generic to most specific, that could be cited in answer to the question of what some substance is (or might be) like. The most generic item in this hierarchy would clearly be a kind of quality, and not the pseudo-genus quality itself.

The claim that each category’s name derives from an interrogative is not entirely accurate about the Categories, where the category of substance is introduced by the non-interrogative ousia. But in the Topics, the first category is introduced by the interrogative ‘what is it?’ (ti esti). Whether the lists of categories in these two works are comparable is debatable, however. For more detail, seen Aristotle’s Logic.

First posted: October 8, 2000
Last modified: November 1, 2000