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Proof.
Suppose that L*N ( E ).
By definition, there is a basis proposition A* such that A*. It suffices to show that for each m 1 and for all agents i 1, i 2, . . . , i m N,
K i 1K i 2 . . . K i m( E )
We prove the result by induction on m. The m = 1 case follows at once from ( L1 ) and ( L3 ). Now if we assume that for m = k, L*N ( E ) implies K i 1K i 2 . . . K i k( E ), then L*N ( E ) K i 1K i 2 . . . K i k( E ) because is an arbitrary possible world, so K i 1( A* ) K i 1K i 2 . . . K i k( E ) by ( L3 ). Since ( L2 ) is the case and the agents of N are A*-symmetric reasoners,
K i 1( A* ) K i 1K i 2 . . . K i k( E )
for any i k+1 N,
so K i 1K i 2 . . . K i k( E )
by ( L1 ), which completes the induction since i 1, i k+1, i 2, . . . , i k
are k + 1 arbitrary agents of N.
First published: August 27, 2001
Content last modified: August 27, 2001