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Einstein correctly described the equivalence of mass and energy as "the most important upshot of the special theory of relativity" (Einstein, 1919), for it is more than a mere curiosity of physics. According to Einstein’s famous equation E = mc2, the energy (E) of a body is numerically equal to the product of its mass (m) and the speed of light (c) squared. It is customary to refer to this result as "the equivalence of mass and energy," or simply "mass-energy equivalence," because one can choose units in which c = 1, and hence E = m. An important consequence of E = mc2 is that a change in the rest-energy of a body is accompanied by a corresponding change to its inertial mass. (This is discussed further in Section 1.) This has led many philosophers to argue that mass-energy equivalence has profound consequences for ontology, the philosophical study of what there is. There are two main philosophical interpretations of E = mc2. The first is that mass-energy equivalence teaches us that "mass" and "energy" designate the same property of physical systems. This is the weaker of the two interpretations because no further ontological claims are made. The second interpretation is that E = mc2 entails that there is only one sort of fundamental stuff in the world. (This is discussed further in Section 2.) Recently, the history of E = mc2 has also attracted the attention of some philosophers. This is primarily, though not exclusively, because this history shows that E = mc2 is a direct consequence of changes to the structure of spacetime brought about by Special Relativity. (This is discussed further in Section 3.)
The equation E=mc2 has two distinct physical consequences. To see this, one needs first to distinguish between a body’s rest-mass and its relativistic mass. In Newtonian physics, the inertial mass of a body is a measure of that body’s resistance to acceleration. This is the notion of mass one uses in everyday life when one talks about, for example, 1 kg. of salt. Furthermore, in Newtonian physics, the inertial mass of a body is independent of its relative state of motion. Because this is no longer the case in relativistic physics, one can identify two notions of mass in Special Relativity (SR). The rest-mass of a body is the inertial mass of that body when it is at rest relative to an inertial frame. The term m in the equation E=mc2 does not represent rest-mass; it represents relativistic mass, which is the inertial mass of a body when it is in a state of motion relative to an inertial frame. If we use mo to designate the rest-mass of a body, then we can re-write Einstein’s equation in the following way:
These equations entail that:
(I) In the frame of reference in which a body is at rest, its energy (in this case called the rest-energy) is equal to the product of its rest-mass mo and the speed of light squared. This is because in this case v = 0, so the Lorentz factor is one.(II) In a frame of reference in which a body moves with velocity v, the energy of the body is equal to the product of its rest-mass, the speed of light squared, and the Lorentz factor.
From (I) it follows that if there is a change in
the rest-energy of a body, there must be a corresponding change in its
rest-mass. For example, if a body is heated, and thereby absorbs a
small amount of energy
E
(as measured in the frame of reference in which the body is at
rest), its rest-mass will increase by a very small amount equal to
E/c2.
This increase is tiny because of the high numerical value of the
speed of light. Indeed, for mid-sized objects, such an increase in
mass would be too small to measure with even the most accurate
balance. For example, if a 1 kg block of gold is heated so that its
temperature increases by 10 °C, then its mass could increase by
as much as 1.4 × 10-14 kg; a cube of gold of this
additional tiny mass would have sides smaller than one
one-thousandths of a millimeter. Similarly, if a body emits an
amount of energy
E,
say in the form of light or heat, its rest-mass will decrease by a
tiny amount
E/c2.
In both cases, the important and novel claim made by SR is that the
inertial mass of a body can change depending on whether it absorbs or
emits energy.
(I) also entails that there are physical interactions in which masses no longer combine by simple addition, as they do in pre-relativistic physics. For example, suppose two bodies A and B collide to produce a single, more massive body AB. Suppose further that a net amount of energy E is emitted in this inelastic collision, say in the form of heat. (I) entails that the rest-mass of AB will be less than the rest-mass of A plus the rest-mass of B by an amount equal to E/c2. This stands in sharp contrast to the pre-relativistic prediction that the rest-mass of AB will be equal to the rest-mass of A plus the rest-mass of B. So, for example, suppose a meteor (A) struck the earth (B). After the crash, the earth (AB) would have a mass that is a tiny bit less than the mass of the meteor plus the mass of the earth prior to the crash. This is because during the collision the meteor loses part of its kinetic energy as heat radiation. This energy loss corresponds to a loss of mass. It is worth emphasizing that, according to SR, it is the inertial mass of bodies that is no longer simply added in collisions such as these. In other words, SR predicts that the resulting body AB will resist acceleration a tiny bit less than one would have predicted according to pre-relativistic physics. There is an analogous result for cases where a single body disintegrates into two or more bodies.
These consequences of (I) also illustrate how the classical conservation principles are modified by SR. According to Newtonian physics, all physical interactions are separately governed by the principles of conservation of mass and conservation of energy. So, for example, according to pre-relativistic physics the mass of the block of gold discussed above must remain the same as it is heated. However, as we have seen, this is not the case in relativistic physics, because the energy absorbed by the block of gold contributes to an increase in its rest-mass. Similarly, Newtonian physics predicts that mass is conserved when the meteor crashes into the earth in the above example. However, according to relativistic physics, some of the mass is radiated away as energy in the form of heat. In both of these examples, it is the total mass and energy of the entire system that is conserved in these interactions. In general, in SR physical interactions no longer satisfy the two classical conservation principles separately. Instead, these two principles are fused into a single principle: the principle of conservation of mass-energy. It is these consequences of (I), and indirectly the fusing of the two classical conservation principles, that have motivated different philosophical interpretations of E=mc2 (see Section 2, Philosophical Interpretations of Mass-Energy Equivalence).
From (II) it follows that no bounded amount of energy is sufficient to accelerate a body to the speed of light. This is because as the speed of a body approaches the speed of light its relativistic mass increases without bound. But this means that the body’s resistance to acceleration, as measured in the inertial frame relative to which it is moving, also increases without bound. In practice, this means that it takes more and more energy to achieve proportionally smaller increases in the speed of a body. For example, suppose an electron requires an amount of energy E to reach 50% of the speed of light. The electron requires twice that amount of energy to reach 90% of the speed of light, roughly six times E to reach 99% of the speed of light, and nearly two hundred times E to reach 99.999% of the speed of light! This consequence of E=mc2 is thus crucial in the design and operation of particle accelerators, and it is often emphasized in the popular media (e.g., in popular science books and films). However, its philosophical import is relatively minor because the increase in relativistic mass does not result in a change to the body. In the frame of reference in which the body is at rest, its inertial mass continues to be mo.
A common misconception surrounding E = mc2 is that it entails that the entire rest-mass of a body can become energy. Strictly speaking, mass-energy equivalence only entails that a change in the rest-energy of a body is invariably accompanied by a corresponding change in the rest-mass of the body. For example, a body may lose a bit of its mass because it radiates a bit of energy. The stronger claim that a body may lose all of its rest-mass as it radiates energy is not a consequence of SR. However, this stronger claim is very well confirmed by experiments in atomic physics. Many particle-antiparticle collisions have been observed, such as collisions between electrons and positrons, where the entire mass of the particles is radiated away as energy in the form of light. Nevertheless, SR leaves open the possibility that a form of matter exists whose mass cannot become energy. This is significant because it emphasizes that mass-energy equivalence is not a consequence of a theory of matter; it is instead a direct consequence of changes to the structure of spacetime imposed by SR (see Section 3, Derivations of Mass-Energy Equivalence: History).
Philosophical interpretations of mass-energy equivalence can be classified into two main groups. Interpretations in the first group, such as Eddington’s (1929), and more recently Torretti’s (1983), regard the terms "mass" and "energy" as designating properties of physical systems. According to these interpretations, E = mc2 teaches us that properties hitherto regarded as distinct are actually the same. For example, Eddington states that "it seems very probable that mass and energy are two ways of measuring what is essentially the same thing, in the same sense that the parallax and distance of a star are two ways of expressing the same property of location" (1929, p. 146). According to Eddington, the distinction between mass and energy is artificial. We treat mass and energy as different properties of physical systems because we routinely measure them using different units. However, one can measure mass and energy using the same units by choosing units in which c =1, i.e., units in which distances are measured in units of time (e.g., light-years). Once we do this, Eddington claims, the distinction between mass and energy disappears.
Torretti (1983) argues along similar lines when he responds to the opposing view, which is held by a minority (e.g., Bunge, 1967; Sachs, 1981). This minority holds that the numerical equivalence of mass and energy is not sufficient to conclude that the two properties are the same. However, according to Torretti, "If a kitchen refrigerator can extract mass from a given jug of water and transfer it by heat radiation or convection to the kitchen wall behind it, a trenchant metaphysical distinction between the mass and the energy of matter does seem far fetched" (1983, p. 307, fn. 13). Like Eddington, Torretti points out mass and energy seem to be different properties because they are measured in different units. But the units of mass and energy are different only if one uses different units for space and time, which one need not do. For Torretti, the apparent difference between mass and energy is thus an illusion that arises from "the convenient but deceitful act of the mind by which we abstract time and space from nature" (1983, p. 307, fn. 13). Interpretations such as Torretti’s and Eddington’s draw no further ontological conclusions from mass-energy equivalence beyond the claim that the two properties are the same. For example, neither Eddington nor Torretti make any explicit claim concerning whether properties are best understood as universals, or whether one ought to be a realist about such properties.
Interpretations in the second group, such as Zahar’s (1984), Einstein and Infeld’s (1938), and Russell’s (1915, 1948), regard "mass" as a measure of the quantity of matter and "energy" as a measure of the quantity of energy. Thus, these interpretations regard "mass" and "energy" as the representatives, within physical theory, of stuff in the world. According to these interpretations, the philosophical lesson of E = mc2 is that we should no longer regard the world as consisting of two types of stuff: matter and energy. Instead, the world is composed of only one type of fundamental stuff. For example, According to Zahar, energy in pre-relativistic physics occupies a distinct "ontological level" from matter primarily because the former is regarded as dependent on the latter, but not vice versa. In relativistic physics, however, Einstein’s famous equation shows that these two ontological levels are in fact identical. According to Zahar, Einstein showed "that ‘energy’ and ‘mass’ could be treated as two names for the same basic entity. The stuff which appears to the senses as hard extended substance and the quantity of energy which characterises a process are in fact one and the same thing" (1989, p. 262). For Zahar, the apparent difference between mass and energy arises from the contingent fact that our senses perceive mass and energy differently. On this reading, mass-energy equivalence has the metaphysical implication that what is real, "is no longer the familiar hard substance but a new entity which can be interchangeably called matter or energy" (1989, p. 263). Thus, Zahar holds that the fundamental stuff of physics is a sort of "I-know-not-what" that we can call either "mass" or "energy."
Einstein and Infeld (1938) hold a slightly different version of this interpretation. They claim that mass-energy equivalence implies that we can no longer distinguish between "matter" and "the field". Einstein and Infeld (1938) argue that in pre-relativistic physics there are physical criteria for distinguishing matter and field since matter has mass but fields do not. Hence, there is a qualitative difference between matter and fields, and so it is reasonable to adopt an ontology containing both. However, the equivalence of mass and energy entails that "matter represents vast stores of energy and that energy represents matter" (1938, p. 242). Consequently, Einstein and Infeld argue, the distinction between matter and field is no longer a qualitative one in relativistic physics. Instead, it is merely a quantitative difference, since "matter is where the concentration of energy is great, field where the concentration of energy is small"(1938, p. 242). Thus, mass-energy equivalence entails that we should adopt an ontology consisting only of fields.
Among philosophers, Russell interprets mass-energy equivalence in a similar fashion to Einstein and Infeld. According to Russell, "a unit of matter tends more and more to be something like an electromagnetic field filling all space, though having its intensity in a small region" (1915, p. 121). In his later work, Russell continues to hold this view. For example, in Human Knowledge, Its Scope and Limits, he points out that "atoms" are merely small regions in which there is a great deal of energy. Furthermore, these regions are precisely the regions where one would have said, in pre-relativistic physics, that there was matter. For Russell, these considerations suggest that "mass is only a form of energy, and there is no reason why matter should not be dissolved into other forms of energy. It is energy, not matter, that is fundamental in physics" (1948, p. 291). Russell is not claiming, as Zahar does, that there is one unknown type of stuff that we can call either "mass" or "energy". Instead, Russell is proposing that mass is reducible to energy in the sense that the world consists only of energy. Thus, for Russell, "mass" and "matter" are otiose in modern physics. Several physicists have held a similar position, though this view is less common now. For example, after a discussion particle-antiparticle annihilation experiments in 1951, Wolfgang Pauli states: "Taking the existence of all these transmutations into account, what remains of the old idea of matter and of substance? The answer is energy. This is the true substance, that which is conserved; only the form in which it appears is changing" (1951, p. 31).
Despite the marked difference in the ontological claims made by the two groups of interpretations, there is one significant similarity. All interpretations implicitly claim that mass-energy equivalence changes our knowledge concerning the extensions of the concepts "mass" and "energy". In pre-relativistic physics, the terms "mass" and "energy" had different extensions and intensions. Relativistic physics teaches us that the extension of the two terms is actually the same. This is analogous to the discovery that the referents of "the morning star" and "the evening star" are the same. We can push the analogy a bit further. Just as it is possible to verify empirically that the planet Venus is the referent of both "the morning star" and "the evening star," it is possible to verify empirically that the extensions of "mass" and "energy" are the same. (See Section 4, Experimental Verification of Mass-Energy Equivalence.) From this perspective, the various interpretations of mass-energy equivalence disagree only about what kinds of things the terms "mass" and "energy" designate.
Einstein first derived mass-energy equivalence from the principles of SR in a small article titled "Does the Inertia of a Body Depend Upon Its Energy Content?" (1905b). This derivation, along with others that followed soon after (e.g., Plank (1906), Von Lau (1911)), uses Maxwell’s theory of electromagnetism. (See Subsection 3.1, Derivations of E = mc2 that Use Maxwell’s Theory.) However, as Einstein later observed (1935), mass-energy equivalence is a result that should be independent of any theory that describes a specific physical interaction. This is the main reason that led physicists to search for "purely dynamical" derivations, i.e., derivations that invoke only mechanical concepts such as "energy" and "momentum", and the principles that govern them. (See Subsection 3.2, Purely Dynamical Derivations of E = mc2.)
Einstein’s original derivation of mass-energy equivalence is the best known in this group. Einstein begins with the following thought-experiment: a body at rest (in some inertial frame) emits two pulses of light of equal energy in opposite directions. Einstein then analyzes this "act of emission" from another inertial frame, which is in a state of uniform motion relative to the first. In this analysis, Einstein uses Maxwell’s theory of electromagnetism to calculate the physical properties of the light pulses (such as their intensity) in the second inertial frame. By comparing the two descriptions of the "act of emission", Einstein arrives at his celebrated result: "the mass of a body is a measure of its energy-content; if the energy changes by L, the mass changes in the same sense by L/9 × 1020, the energy being measured in ergs, and the mass in grammes" (1905b, p. 71). A similar derivation using the same thought experiment but appealing to the Doppler effect was given by Langevin (1913) (see the discussion of E = mc2 in Fox (1965)).
Some philosophers and historians of science claim that
Einstein’s first derivation is fallacious. For example, in
The Concept of Mass, Jammer says: "It is a curious incident
in the history of scientific thought that Einstein’s own
derivation of the formula E = mc2,
as published in his article in Annalen der Physik, was
basically fallacious. . . the result of a petitio
principii, the conclusion begging the question" (Jammer, 1961,
p. 177). According to Jammer, Einstein implicitly assumes what he is
trying to prove, viz., that if a body emits an amount of energy
L, its inertial mass will decrease by an amount
m =
L/c2. Jammer also accuses Einstein of assuming
the expression for the relativistic kinetic energy of a body. If
Einstein made these assumptions, he would be guilty of begging the
question. Recently, however, Stachel and Torretti (1982) have shown
convincingly that Einstein’s (1905b) argument is sound. They note
that Einstein indeed derives the expression for the kinetic energy of
an "electron" (i.e., a structureless particle with a net charge) in his
earlier (1905a) paper. However, Einstein nowhere uses this expression
in the (1905b) derivation of mass-energy equivalence. Stachel and
Torretti also show that Einstein’s critics overlook two key moves
that are sufficient to make Einstein’s derivation sound, since one need
not assume that
m =
L/c2.
Einstein’s further conclusion that "the mass of a body is a measure of its energy content" (1905b, p. 71) does not, strictly speaking, follow from his argument. As Torretti (1983) and other philosophers and physicists have observed, Einstein’s (1905b) argument allows for the possibility that once a body’s energy store has been entirely used up (and subtracted from the mass using the mass-energy equivalence relation) the remainder is not zero. In other words, it is only an hypothesis in Einstein’s (1905b) argument, and indeed in all derivations of E = mc2 in SR, that no "exotic matter" exists that is not convertible into energy (see Ehlers, Rindler, Penrose, (1965) for a discussion of this point). However, particle-antiparticle anihilation experiments in atomic physics, which were first observed decades after 1905, strongly support "Einstein’s dauntless extrapolation" (Torretti, 1983, p. 112).
Purely dynamical derivations of E = mc2 typically proceed by analyzing an inelastic collision from the point of view of two inertial frames in a state of relative motion (the centre-of-mass frame, and an inertial frame moving with a relative velocity v). One of the first papers to appear following this approach is Perrin’s (1932). According to Rindler and Penrose (1965), Perrin’s derivation was based largely on Langevin’s "elegant" lectures, which were delivered at the College de France in Zurich around 1922. Einstein himself gave a purely dynamical derivation (Einstein, 1935), though he nowhere mentions either Langevin or Perrin. The most comprehensive derivation of this sort was given by Ehlers, Rindler and Penrose (1965). More recently, a purely dynamical version of Einstein’s original (1905b) thought experiment, where the particles that are emitted are not photons, has been given by Mermin and Feigenbaum (1990).
Derivations in this group are distinctive because they demonstrate that mass-energy equivalence is a consequence of the changes to the structure of spacetime brought about by SR. The relationship between mass and energy is independent of Maxwell’s theory or any other theory that describes a specific physical interaction.We can get a glimpse of this by noting that to derive E = mc2 by analyzing a collision, one must first define relativistic momentum (prel) and relativistic kinetic energy (Trel), since one cannot use the old Newtonian notions of momentum and kinetic energy. In Einstein’s own purely dynamical derivation (1935), more than half of the paper is devoted to finding the mathematical expressions that define prel and Trel. This much work is required to arrive at these expressions for two reasons. First, the changes to the structure of spacetime must be incorporated into the definitions of the relativistic quantities. Second, prel and Trel must be defined so that they reduce to their Newtonian counterparts in the appropriate limit. This last requirement ensures, in effect, that SR will inherit the empirical success of Newtonian physics. Once the definitions of prel and Trel are obtained, the derivation of mass-energy equivalence is straight-forward. (For a more detailed discussion of Einstein’s (1935), see Flores, (1998).)
Cockcroft and Walton (1932) are routinely credited with the first
experimental verification of mass-energy equivalence. Einstein
(1905b) had conjectured that the equivalence of mass and energy could
be tested by "weighing" an atom before and after it undergoes
radioactive decay. But there was no way of performing this
experiment or another experiment that would directly confirm
mass-energy equivalence at the time. Technological developments
allowed Cockcroft and Walton to take a different approach. They
studied the bombardment of a lithium atom (Li) by a proton (p), which
produces two alpha particles
(
).
This reaction is symbolized by the following equation:
In this reaction, there is a decrease in the total rest-mass as the reaction proceeds from left to right: the total rest-mass of proton and the Lithium atom is greater than the total rest-mass of the two alpha particles. Furthermore, there is also an increase in the total kinetic energy: the kinetic energy of the proton is less than the total kinetic energy of the two alpha particles. (One only considers the kinetic energy of the proton because the Lithium atom is considered at rest, and hence has zero kinetic energy.) Cockcroft and Walton were able to measure the kinetic energies of the incident proton and the out-going alpha particles very precisely. They found that the decrease in rest-mass corresponds to the increase in kinetic energy according to Einstein’s famous equation E = mc2 (to an accuracy of better than 1%). Hence, the total mass and energy of the entire system is conserved.
First published: September 12, 2001
Content last modified: September 12, 2001
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