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The central concept of feminist epistemology is that of a situated knower, and hence of situated knowledge: knowledge that reflects the particular perspectives of the subject. Feminist philosophers are interested in how gender situates knowing subjects. They have articulated three main approaches to this question: feminist standpoint theory, feminist postmodernism, and feminist empiricism. Different conceptions of how gender situates knowers also inform feminist approaches to the central problems of the field: evaluating ideals of objectivity and rationality, defining the proper roles of social and political values in inquiry, grounding feminist criticisms of science and feminist science, and reforming structures of epistemic authority.
Situated knowledge in general. Consider how people may understand the same object in different ways that reflect the distinct relations in which they stand to it. Embodiment. People experience the world by using their bodies, which have different constitutions and are differently located in space and time. In virtue of their different physical locations, observers who stand in front of an object have different information about it than observers who have a distant but bird’s eye view of it. First-person vs. third-person knowledge. People have first-personal access to their own bodily and mental states, yielding direct knowledge of phenomenological facts about what it is like for them to be in these states. Others may know their token states only by interpreting external symptoms, imaginative projection, or obtaining their testimony. People also have knowledge de se about themselves, expressed in the form "I am F here, now." This is distinct in character and inferential role from propositional knowledge having the same content, which does not use indexicals. Emotions, attitudes, interests, and values. People often represent objects in relation to the emotions and attitudes they have toward them and the interests they have in them. A thief represents a lock as a frustrating obstacle while its owner represents the lock as a comforting source of security. Personal knowledge of others. People have different knowledge of others, in virtue of their different personal relationships to them. Such knowledge is often tacit, incompletely articulated, and intuitive. Like the knowledge it takes to get a joke, it is more an interpretive skill in making sense of a person than a set of propositions. (The German language usefully marks this as the distinction between Erkenntnis and Wissenschaft.) Because people behave differently toward others, and others interpret their behavior differently, depending on their personal relationships to them, what others know of them depends on these relationships. Know-how. People have different skills, which constitute a form of situated knowledge in themselves, and also generate different propositional knowledge for those with different skills. An expert dog handler knows how to elicit more interesting behavior from an a dog than a novice does. Such know-how expresses a more sophisticated understanding of dogs on the part of the expert, and also generates new phenomena about dogs for investigation. Cognitive Styles. People have different styles of investigation and representation. What looks like one phenomenon to a lumper may look like three to a splitter. Background beliefs and worldviews. People form different beliefs about an object, in virtue of different background beliefs. In virtue of the different background beliefs against which they interpret a patient’s symptoms, a patient may think he is having a heart attack while his doctor believes he just has heartburn. Differences in global metaphysical or political worldviews (naturalism, theism, liberalism, marxism) may also generate different beliefs about particulars on a more comprehensive scale. Relations to other inquirers. People may stand in different epistemic relations to other inquirers--for example, as informants, interlocutors, students--which affects their access to relevant information and their ability to convey their beliefs to others.
These kinds of situatedness affect knowledge in several ways. They influence knowers’ access to information and the terms in which they represent what they know. They bear on the form of their knowledge (articulate/implicit, formal/informal, by acquaintance or description, and so forth). They affect their attitudes toward their beliefs (certainty/doubt, dogmatic/open to revision), their standards of justification (relative weights they give to different epistemic values such as predictive power and consilience, amount, sources, and kinds of evidence they require before they accept a claim, etc.), and the authority with which they lay claim to their beliefs and can offer them to others. Finally, they affect knowers’ assessment of which claims are significant or important.
Social situation. Many of these ways in which knowers’ physical and psychological relations to the world affects what and how they know are familiar and extensively studied by cognitive psychology, naturalized epistemology, and philosophy of science. Feminist epistemology takes such studies a further step by considering how the social location of the knower affects what and how she knows. It can thus be seen as a branch of social epistemology (Anderson 1995a). An individual’s social locations consists of her ascribed social identities (gender, race, sexual orientation, ethnicity, caste, kinship status, etc.) and social roles and relationships (occupation, political party membership, etc.). Partly in virtue of their different ascribed identities, individuals occupy different social roles that accord them different powers, duties, and role-given goals and interests. They are subject to different norms that prescribe different virtues, habits, emotions, and skills that are thought to be appropriate for these roles. They also acquire different subjective identities. Subjective identification with one’s social groups can take several forms. One may simply know oneself to have certain ascribed identities. One may accept or endorse these identities, actively affirming the norms and roles associated with them. Or one may regard one’s social identities as oppressive (if, say, one’s identity is cast by society as evil, contemptable, or disgusting), yet see one’s fate as tied with the groups with which one is identified, and commit oneself to collective action with other members of those groups to overcome that oppression.
Gender as a mode of social situation. Most feminist theorists distinguish between sex and gender. Sex comprises the biological differences between males and females. Gender is what societies make of sexual differences: the different roles, norms, and meanings they assign to men and women and the things associated with them on acc ount of their real or imagined sexual characteristics. Gender thus has several dimensions (Haslanger 2000). Gender roles. Men and women are assigned to distinct social roles. For example, in most societies political and military offices are reserved mostly for men, while women are assigned most childrearing responsibilities. Gender norms. Men and women are expected to comply with different norms of behavior and bodily comportment--for example, men are expected to be assertive and athletic; women, deferential and modest. Gender norms are tailored to gender roles: men and women are expected to conform to those norms that make them fit for their gender roles (whether or not they actually occupy those roles). Gendered traits and virtues. Psychological traits are considered "masculine" and "feminine" if they dispose their bearers to comply with the gender norms assigned to men and women, respectively. "Masculine" traits are therefore regarded as virtues in men and (often) vices in women, while "feminine" traits are regarded as vices in men and virtues in women. Gendered performance/behavior. Many feminist theorists, often influenced by postmodernism, have come to stress the contextual and performative aspects of gender (West and Zimmerman 1987; Butler 1990). Rather than viewing masculinity and femininity as fixed traits, expressed in every social context, these theorists represent human beings as more flexible and disposed to enact both "masculine" and "feminine" behaviors in different contexts. The man who avoids tenderly comforting a crying baby in the presence of women may do so when alone. Rather than viewing masculinity and femininity as manifested only in behavior within fixed, distinct gender roles, they can be seen as contrasting styles of performance in almost any role. Female body builders strive to show off their muscles in a "feminine" way. Gender identity. A person’s ascribed gender identity--how others identify him or her--may not match his or her subjective gender identity--the sense that one is "really" a man or a woman. Subjective gender identity includes all of the ways one might understand oneself to be a man or a woman. One could identify with any subset of gender norms, roles, and traits ascribed to the gender of which one sees oneself as a member, while repudiating others. One could even repudiate them all, but still identify oneself as a man or a women in terms of what one sees as distinct roles men and women ought to play in bringing about a just future (one that may or may not include gender distinctions). One could, as many feminists do, understand one’s gender identity as a predicament shared by all with the same ascribed identity, and thus as a basis for collective action to change the very basis of one’s gender identity. One could embrace an "androcentric" identity, including both "feminine" and "masculine" roles, norms, and traits, decline to view oneself in gender polarized terms at all, or play with gender identities in a postmodernist spirit. Gender symbolism. Animals and inanimate objects may be placed in a gendered field of representation because of conventional association, imaginative projection, and metaphorical thinking. Thus, the garage is regarded as "male" space, the kitchen, "female"; male deer are said to have "harems"; pears are seen as "womanly", assault rifles as "manly."
Gendered knowledge. By bringing together the general account of situated knowledge with the account of gender as a kind of social situation, we can now generate a catalogue of ways in which what people know, or think they know, can be influenced by their own gender (roles, norms, traits, peformance, identities), other people’s genders, or by ideas about gender (symbolism). Each mode of gendered knowledge raises new questionsfor epistemology.
The phenomenology of gendered bodies. People’s bodies are not just differently sexed, they are differently gendered. Early child socialization trains boys’ and girls’ bodies to different norms of bodily comportment. In the U.S., these norms stress physical freedom, aggressive play, large motor skills, informal and relaxed posture, and indifference to clothing, neatness and appearance in boys; physical constraint, subdued play, small motor skills, formal and modest posture, and self-consciousness about clothing, neatness and appearance for girls (Martin 1996). Once internalized, such norms profoundly affect the phenomenology of embodiment. They inform men’s and women’s distinct first-personal knowledge of what it is like to inhabit a body, to express capacities unique to one sex or another (e.g., breast feeding), and to have experiences that are manifested through different body parts in differently sexed bodies (e.g., orgasm). They also cause men’s and women’s experiences of gendered behaviors that both can peform to differ--in comfort, fluidity, feelings of "naturalness" or novelty, self-consciousness, confidence, awkwardness, shame, and so forth. One question these facts raise for feminist epistemology is to what extent dominant models of the world, especially of the relation between minds and bodies, have seemed compelling because they conform to a male or masculine phenomenlogy (Bordo 1987; Young 1990).
Gendered first-personal knowledge de se. It is one thing to know what sexual harassment is, and how to identify it in a case described in third-personal terms. It is another to come to the recognition "I have been sexually harassed." Many women who are able to see that women in general are subordinated have difficulty recognizing themselves as sharing women’s predicament (Clayton and Crosby 1992). The problems of de se knowledge are particularly pressing for feminist theory, because it is committed to theorizing in ways that women can use to improve their lives. This entails that women be able to recognize themselves and their lives in feminist accounts of women’s predicament. Feminist epistemology is therefore particularly concerned with investigating the conditions of feminist self-understanding and the social settings in which it may arise--feminist consciousness-raising sessions, women’s studies classes, and so forth (MacKinnon 1989).
Gendered emotions, attitudes, interests, and values. Feminist theory defines a representation as androcentric if it depicts the world in relation to male or masculine interests, emotions, attitudes or values. A "male" interest is an interest a man has, in virtue of the goals given to him by social roles that are designated as especially appropriate for men to occupy, or in virtue of his subjective gender identity. A "masculine" interest is an interest a man has in virtue of attitudes or psychological dispositions that are thought specifically appropriate to men. Such attitudes and interests structure the cognition of those who have them. For example, a representational scheme that classifies women as either "babes," "dogs," "whores," or (grand)mothers reflects the androcentric attitudes, interests, and values of single heterosexual adolescent men who view women in terms of their fantasized eligibility for sexual intercourse with them. A representation is gynocentric if it depicts the world in relation to female or feminine interests, emotions, attitudes or values. When a man is described as an "eligible bachelor," this reflects the gynocentric perspective of a heterosexual, single woman interested in marriage. An interest, emotion, attitude, or value might be symbolically gendered even if men and women do not manifest it differently. For example the ethics of care represents moral problems in terms of symbolically feminine values--values culturally associated with women’s gender roles (Gilligan 1982). It thus can qualify as a symbolically gynocentric perspective, even if men and women do not differ in their propensity to represent moral problems in its terms, and are equally able to act accordingly. From a performative perspective, this shows that men can behave in "feminine" ways, too. Feminist epistemology raises numerous questions about these phenomena. Can situated emotional responses to things be a valid source of knowledge about them (Diamond 1991, Jaggar 1989, Keller 1983)? Do dominant practices and conceptions of science and scientific method reflect an androcentric perspective, or a perspective that reflects other dominant positions, as of race and colonial rule (Merchant 1980; Harding 1986, 1991, 1993, 1998)? Do mainstream philosophical conceptions of objectivity, knowledge, and reason reflect an androcentric perspective (Bordo 1987; Code 1991; Flax 1983; Rooney 1991)? How would the conceptual frameworks of particular sciences change if they reflected women’s interests (Anderson 1995b, Waring 1990)?
Knowledge of others in gendered relationships. Gender norms differentially structure the social spaces to which men and women are admitted, as well as the presentation of self to others. As performative theories of gender stress, men manifest their male identity, and women their female identity, differently alone than in mixed company, and differently in these settings than in gender-segregated contexts. Male and female inquirers therefore have access to different information about others. Male and female ethnographers may be admitted to different social spaces. Even when admitted to the same social spaces, their presence has different effects on those being observed, because they cannot stand in the same social relationships to their subjects. Physical objects do not behave differently depending on whether a man or a woman is observing them. But human beings do behave differently according to their beliefs about the gender of who is observing them. Research that elicits information about others through personal contact between the researchers and the research subjects therefore raises the question of how findings might be influenced by the gendered relations between researchers and subjects, and whether gender-inclusive research teams are in a better position to detect this. Ethnography, which derives propositional knowledge of others from personal knowledge of native informants in long-term, often intimate relationships, raises these issues most acutely (Bell et al 1993; Leacocke 1981). Similar issues arise in survey research, clinical research, and human experimentation (Sherif 1987).
Gendered skills. Some skills are labelled masculine or feminine because men and women need them specifically to perform their respective gender roles, and they are not generically useful for almost any role (as walking, talking, and seeing are). It takes a particular knowledge of small children to know how to comfort them, a particular knowledge of soldiers to know how to whip up their morale. Although men and women alike may acquire and exercise these skills, they are considered the peculiar responsibility of one or the other gender. Men and women may therefore have differential access to such skill-based knowledge, and not just because they have devoted their energies to acquiring different skills. To the extent that the skill is perceived by the agent as the proper province of the "other" gender, he or she may have a difficult time seeing himself or herself perform it confidently and fluidly, and this inability to self-identify with the task can impair performance. The feedback effects of the phenomenology of gendered embodiment and de se knowledge of one’s own subjective gender identity can therefore influence the exercise of gendered skills. To the extent that a skill is perceived by others as the proper province of one gender, others may grant or withhold acknowledgment of an agent’s expertise. If the successful exercise of the skill requires that others be willing to accept it as a competent performance--as in the cases of comforting children or raising soldiers’ morale--others’ gender-based readiness or refusal to grant expertise to an agent in exercising that skill can be a self-fulfilling prophecy. These phenomena raise various questions for epistemology. Does the "masculine" symbolism of certain scientific skills, such as of assuming an "objective" stance toward nature, interfere with the integration of women into science? Do actually or symbolically "feminine" skills aid the acquisition of scientific knowledge (Keller 1983, 1985; Rose 1987; Smith 1974)?
Gendered cognitive styles. Some theorists believe that men and women have different cognitive styles (Belenky et al 1986; Gilligan 1982). Whether or not this is true, cognitive styles are gender symbolized (Rooney 1991). Analytic, atomistic, acontextual, and quantitative cognitive styles are labelled "masculine," while synthetic, holistic, contextual and qualitative cognitive styles are labelled "feminine." Such associations are not wholly arbitrary, the way blue is gendered male and pink, female. For example, it is seen as masculine to make one’s point by means of argument, feminine to make one’s point by means of narrative. Argument is commonly cast as an adversarial mode of discourse, in which one side claims vindication by vanquishing the opposition. Such pursuit of dominance follows the competitive pattern of male gender roles in combat, athletics, and business. Narrative is a seductive mode of discourse, persuading by an enticing invitation to take up the perspective of the narrator, which excites one’s imagination and feeling. Its operations are more like love than war, and thereby follows a mode of persuasion thought more suitable for women. These phenomena raise numerous epistemological questions: does the quest for "masculine" prestige by using "masculine" methods distort practices of knowledge acquisition (Addelson 1983; Moulton, 1983)? Are some kinds of sound research unfairly ignored because of their association with "feminine" cognitive styles (Keller 1983)? Do "feminine" cognitive styles yield knowledge that is inaccessible or harder to achieve by "masculine" means (Duran 1991, Rose 1987, Smith 1974)?
Gendered background beliefs and worldviews. We have seen above how men and women have access to different phenomenlogical knowledge, de se knowledge, know-how, and personal knowledge of others, in virtue of their gender. They also tend to represent the world in different terms, in virtue of their gendered interests, attitudes, emotions and values, and perhaps also (although this is a matter of controversy among feminist theorists) in virtue of different cognitive styles. These differences create different background webs of belief against which information to which men and women have in principle equal access may be processed. Representational schemes that are functional for different gender roles and gendered attitudes make different kinds of information salient. In traditional domestic settings, women tend to notice dirt that men don’t. This is not because women have a specially sensitive sensory apparatus. It is because they have a role which designates the females of the household as the ones who have to clean up. Male surgeons have no difficulty maintaining much higher degrees of vigilance about contamination in an operating room than would ever be warranted in housecleaning. Besides making different kinds of information salient to men and women, their different background knowledge may lead them to interpret commonly accessed information differently. A man in a singles bar might read a woman’s demure smile as a coy come-on, where another woman may interpret it as her polite and defensive reaction to unwanted attention from him. Such differences can spring from differential access to phenomenological knowledge. The male and female observers imaginatively project themselves into her situation, inferring her feelings from the feelings they think underlie her body language. Because men’s and women’s phenomenologies of embodiment are different--most men are not in the habit of smiling as a defense against unwanted attention from women--the man may narcissistically imagine the smile as relaxed and spontaneous, whereas the woman may suspect it is forced. Here are a few epistemological questions raised by these phenomena. Are there epistemic obtacles to men’s ability to know when they are raping or sexually harassing women, or to legal institutions recognizing this, insofar as they confine their thinking within a "masculine" perspective (MacKinnon 1989)? More generally, do the unexamined sexist or androcentric background beliefs of scientists cause them to generate sexist theories about women, despite their adherence to ostensibly objective scientific methods (Birke et al 1980; Harding 1986; Harding and O’Barr, 1987; Hubbard 1990)? More generally still, how might the social practices of science be organized so that variations in background beliefs of inquirers function as a resource rather than an obstacle to scientific success (Longino 1990; Solomon 1994)?
Relations to other inquirers. Gender differences in knowledge and background beliefs can be reduced if men and women participate in inquiry together. Each gender can take on testimony what the other can acquire through direct experience. Each may also learn how to exercise imaginative projection more effectively, and to take up the perspective of the other gender. However, gender norms influence the terms on which men and women communicate (Kalbfleisch 1995). In many contexts, women are not allowed to speak or even show up, or their questions, comments, and challenges are ignored, interrupted, and systematically distorted, or they aren’t accepted as experts. Gendered norms of conversational interaction and epistemic authority thus influence the ability of knowledge practices to incorporate the knowledge and experience of men and women into their processes of discovery and justification. Feminist epistemologists are therefore interested in exploring how gender norms distort the dissemination of testimony and relations of cognitive authority among inquirers (Addelson 1983; Code 1991) and how the social relations of inquirers could be reformed, especially with regard to the allocation of epistemic authority, so as to enable more successful practices of inquiry (Longino 1990; Nelson 1990, 1993).
Mainstream epistemology takes as paradigms of knowledge simple propositional knowledge about matters in principle equally accessible to anyone with basic cognitive and sensory apparatus: "2 + 2=4"; "grass is green"; "water quenches thirst." Feminist epistemology does not claim that such knowledge is gendered. But examination of such examples is not particularly helpful for answering the epistemological problems that arise specifically in feminist theory and practice. What is it to know that I am a woman? What is it like to be sexually objectified? Why is it that men and women so often have dramatically divergent understandings of what happened in their sexual encounters? How can we arrange scientific practices so that science and technology serve women’s interests? These kinds of questions make other kinds of knowledge salient for feminist epistemology: phenomenological knowledge, de se knowledge, knowledge of persons, know-how, moral knowledge, knowledge informed by emotions, attitudes, and interests. These kinds of knowledge are often gendered, as we have seen, and they can influence the propositional claims people are disposed to form and accept. This has critical implications for mainstream epistemological conceptions of knowledge, insofar as the latter are based on false generalizations drawing only from examples of ungendered knowledge.
Feminist epistemologists stress the situatedness or perspective-relativity of much knowledge. They do not thereby embrace epistemological relativism. To regard some knowledge claim or form of understanding as situated in a perspective is not to claim that the perspective yields true beliefs or satisfactory understandings (not even "for" those taking up the perspective). It is not to claim that perspectives can only be judged in their own terms, nor that no perspectives are better than others, nor that one cannot take a more objective view of the phenomena than that taken up in one or another perspective. It is not to claim that all knowledge necessarily reflects some peculiar non-universalizable relation of a subset of knowers to the object of knowledge. What attention to situated knowledge does do is enable questions to be raised and addressed that are difficult even to frame in epistemologies that simply assume that gender, and the social situation of the knower more generally, is irrelevant to knowledge. How are the knowledge claims generated by gendered perspectives related to one another? Can men take up a gynocentric perspective, and women, an androcentric perspective? Or are there epistemological barriers to such perspective crossing? Are certain perspectives epistemically privileged? Is there any way to construct a more objective perspective out of differently gendered perspectives? What is the relation of an objective perspective, if one is possible, to gendered perspectives? What would be the point of achieving such a perspective? Would the achievement of such an objective perspective make possible or desirable the elimination of gendered perspectives? Feminist epistemology does not rule out in advance the possibility or desirability of objective knowledge. It does, however, raise new questions about objectivity.
First published: August 9, 2000
Content last modified: August 9, 2000