Logical Form

(1)	John danced if Mary sang, and Mary sang; so John danced.
(2)	Every politician is deceitful, and every senator is a politician; so every senator is deceitful.
(3)	The tallest man is in the garden; so someone is in the garden.

(4)	John danced if Mary sang, and John danced; so Mary sang.
(5)	Every hairless biped is a bird, Tweety is a hairless biped; so Tweety can fly.
(6)	Every human born before 1850 has died; so every human will die.

Appeals to logical form arose in the context of attempts to say more about this intuitive distinction between impeccable inferences, which invite metaphors of security and immediacy, and inferences that involve a risk of slipping from truth to falsity. The motivations for saying more are both practical and theoretical. Experience teaches us that an inference can initially seem more secure than it is; and if we knew which inferences are risk-free, we might be more alert to the points at which we risk error. (Such alertness might be valuable, even if the risks are tolerable.) Claims about inference are also connected, in various ways, with claims about thought and its relation to language. So we would like to know in virtue of what, if anything, an inference is impeccable. The most common suggestion has been that certain inferences are absolutely secure by virtue of their (logical) form; although conceptions of form have evolved in tandem with conceptions of logic and language.

• 1. Patterns of Reason
• 2. Propositions and Traditional Grammar
• 3. Motivations for Revision
• 4. Frege and Formal Language
• 5. Descriptions and Analysis
• 6. Restricted Quantifiers
• 7. Transformational Grammar
• 8. Semantic Structure and Events
• Bibliography
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

1. Patterns of Reason

(7)	Chris swam if Pat was asleep, and Pat was asleep; so Chris swam.

If the first then the second, but not the second; so not the first.

Either the first or the second, but not the second; so the first.

Not both the first and the second, but the first; so not the second.

We can now draw an important distinction. In speaking of an inference, one might be talking about (i) a mental process in which a thinker draws a conclusion from some premises, or (ii) the propositions a thinker would accept (perhaps tentatively or hypothetically) if she accepted the premises and conclusion, with one proposition designated as an alleged consequence of the others. The latter notion seems to be primary with respect to what makes an inference risk-free. For a risky thought process is one in which a thinker who accepts certain propositions comes to accept, without further evidence, a proposition that does not follow from the initial assumptions. So let us focus on premises and conclusions, as opposed to episodes of reasoning; and let us assume that propositions themselves have forms. Then the inference

(1)	John danced if Mary sang, and Mary sang; so John danced.

It is not obvious that all impeccable inferences are instances of some valid form, and thus inferences whose impeccability is due to the forms of the relevant propositions. But this thought has served as an ideal for the study of inference, at least since Aristotle’s treatment of examples like

(2)	Every politician is deceitful, and every senator is a politician; so every senator is deceitful.

Every P is D, and every S is a P; so every S is D.

Every P is D, and some S is a P; so some S is D

Some S is not D, every S is a P; so some P is not D.

Propositions thus seem to have structure that bears on the (im)peccability of inferences, even ignoring premises/conclusions with propositional parts. That is, even ‘simple’ propositions have logical form. As Aristotle noted, pairs of such propositions can be related in interesting ways. If every P is D (and there is at least one P), then some P is D. If no P is D, then some P is not D. It is certain that either every P is D or some P is not D; and whichever of these propositions is true, the other is false. Similarly, the following propositions cannot both be true: every P is D; and no P is D. But it is not certain that either every P is D or no P is D. (Perhaps some P is D and some P is not D.) This network of logical relations strongly suggests that the propositions in question contain a quantificational element; two general elements; and sometimes, an element of negation. This raises the question of whether other propositions have a similar structure.

2. Propositions and Traditional Grammar

(8)	Every planet is bright, and Venus is a planet; so Venus is bright.

The sentence ‘every politican is deceitful’ intuitively divides into two major parts, as shown by the slash: ‘every politician / is deceitful’. Similarly for ‘Venus / is bright’, ‘some politician / swam’, and ‘the brightest planet / rises early in the evening’. Until fairly recently, it was held that every declarative sentence can be divided into subject and predicate in this way, and that propositions were like sentences in this respect. Aristotle would have said that in ‘Venus is bright’, (the property of being) bright is predicated of Venus; in ‘every P is D’, D is predicated of every P. Thus, ‘Venus’ and ‘every politician’ can both indicate subjects; and the word ‘is’ introduces a predicate. Using slightly different terminology, other theorists treated all elements of generality as predicates, and propositions with the following structure were said to have categorical form: subject-copula-predicate; where a copula, indicated by words like ‘is’ or ‘was’, links a subject (which can consist of a quantifier and predicate) to a predicate.

In this context, it is relevant that sentences like ‘Every man swam’ can---with some awkwardness---be paraphrased by sentences like ‘Every man was a swimmer’. So perhaps both sentences indicate the same proposition, while the second better reflects the true categorical form of the proposition. Maybe ‘swim’ is an abbreviation for ‘was a swimmer’, in the way that ‘bachelor’ is arguably short for ‘unmarried man’. (One would violate English grammar by saying ‘Every man was swimmer’; the article ‘a’ is needed. But let us assume that this feature of English, not found in all languages, is not reflected in propositions.)

The proposition that every man is tall if Venus is bright seems to be a ‘molecular’ compound of categorical propositions; the same complex proposition is presumably indicated by ‘if Venus is bright then every man is tall’. The proposition that not only every man is tall apparently extends a categorical proposition, via the elements indicated by ‘not’ and ‘only’. Such reflections suggest the possibility, explored with great ingenuity by medieval logicians, that all propositions are composed of categorical propositions and a small number of logical (or so-called syncategorematic) elements. This is not to say that all propositions were, or could be, analyzed in this manner. But by formulating various Aristotelian inference schemata, in ways that complemented proposed analyses of complex propositions, many impeccable infererences were revealed as instances of valid syllogistic forms.

Medieval logicians also discussed the relation of logic to grammar. Many viewed their project, in part, as an attempt to uncover principles of a mental language common to all thinkers. (Aristotle had said that spoken sounds symbolize ‘affections of the soul’.) From this perspective, one expects a few differences between the logical forms of propositions, and overt features of sentences. Spoken languages must mask certain aspects of logical structure, if the proposition that every man swam has categorical form3and thus contains a copula. Ockham held that a mental language would have no need for Latin’s declensions, and that logicians could ignore such aspects of spoken language. The ancient Greeks were aware of sophisms like: that dog is a father, and that dog is yours; so that dog is your father. This bad inference cannot share its form with the superficially parallel (but impeccable) variant: that dog is a mutt, and that mutt is yours; so that dog is your mutt. So the superficial features of sentences are not infallible guides to the logical forms of propositions. But the divergence was held to be relatively minor. Spoken sentences have structure; they are composed, in systematic ways, of words. And the assumption was that sentences reflect the major aspects of logical form, including subject-predicate structure. There is a distinction between logic and the task of describing the sentences used in spoken languages. But the connection between logic and grammar was thought to run deep, making it tempting to say that the logical form of a proposition is the grammatical form of some (perhaps mental) sentence.

3. Motivations for Revision

Some valid schemata are reducible to others, in that any inference of the reducible form can be revealed as valid (with a little work) given other schemata. And this turns out to be important. Consider

(9)	If Al ran then either Al did not run or Bob did not swim, and Al ran; so Bob did not swim.

(10)	Some P is not D, and every S is D; so not every P is an S.

This invites the thought that further reduction is possible, especially given another respect in which there are more syllogistic schemata than one would like. Consider the contribution indicated by ‘every’ to propositions of the form: every P is D; not every P is D; every P is not D, etc. Ideally, one would specify this contribution--the logical role of the universal quantifer--with a single schema that reveals a common contribution to all propositions containing a universal quantifier. Similarly, one would like to characterize the common contribution of negation to propositions of diverse forms: not A; not every P is D; some P is not D; not both A and B; etc. But syllogistic logic is not ideal in this respect.

Correspondingly, one might suspect that there are relatively few basic inferential patterns. Some inferences may reflect inherently compelling transitions in thought. Perhaps ‘B if A, and A; so B’ is so obvious that logicians are entitled to take this rule of inference as axiomatic. But how many rules are plausibly regarded as fundamental in this sense? Theoretical elegance and explanatory depth favor theories with fewer irreducible assumptions. Indeed, Euclid’s geometry had long provided a model for how to present a body of knowledge as a network of propositions that follow from a few basic axioms; and for several reasons, foundational questions played an important role in nineteenth century logic and mathematics. The work of Boole and others showed that progress in this regard was possible with respect to the logic of inferences involving propositional variables. But the syllogisms remained disunified and incomplete, for reasons related to another failing of traditional logic/grammar.

Propositions involving relations--e.g., the proposition that Juliet kissed Romeo--are evidently not categorical. One might suggest ‘Juliet was a kisser of Romeo’ as an overtly categorical paraphrase. But the predicate ‘kisser of Romeo’ differs, in ways that matter to inference, from predicates like ‘woman’. If some kisser of Romeo died, it follows that someone was kissed; whereas the proposition that some woman died has no comparable consequence (stated in the passive voice). Correlatively, if Juliet kissed Romeo, then Juliet kissed someone. This last proposition is of interest, even if we express it by saying ‘Juliet was a kisser of Romeo’; for such a proposition involves a quantifier (outside the subject) as part of a complex predicate. And traditional logic does not provide the resources needed for capturing the validity of inferences whose validity depends on quantifiers within predicates, as in:

(11)	Some patient respects some doctor, and every doctor is a sailor; so some patient respects some sailor.

Some P is T, and every D is an S; so some P is O.

One can introduce a variable ‘R’, intended to range over relations, and formulate the following schema:
some P R some D, and every D is an S; so some P R some S. But the problem remains. Quantifiers can still appear in the predicates, as in the following (complex, but still impeccable) inference:

(12)	Every patient who met every doctor is tall, and some patient who met every doctor respects every senator; so some patient who respects every senator is tall.

Every P(R₁ every D) is T, and some P(R₁ every D) R₂ every S; so some P(R₂ every S) is T.

4. Frege and Formal Language

Frege’s leading idea was that propositions have ‘function-argument’ structure. The intended analogy to mathematical functions, developed by Frege in later work, intimates his view. The successor function maps every integer onto its successor; it maps the number 1 onto the number 2, 2 onto 3, etc. We can represent this function, using a variable that ranges over integers, as follows: S(x) = x + 1. As this notation makes clear, the function takes integers as arguments; and given an argument, the value of the function is the successor of that argument. The division function, representable as ‘Q(y, z) = y/z’, maps ordered pairs of numbers onto quotients; the pair (8, 4) onto 2; (9, 3) onto 3; etc. Mappings can also be conditional, as with the function that maps every even integer onto itself and odd integer onto its successor: F(x) = x if x is even, and x + 1 otherwise. By itself, however, no function has a value. Frege says that functions are saturated by arguments. The metaphor, encouraged by his claim that we can indicate functions with expressions like ‘S( ) = ( ) + 1’, is that a function has ‘holes’ that can be ‘filled’ by arguments (of the right sort). Variable letters, such as the ‘y’ and ‘z’ in as ‘Q(y, z) = y/z’, are convenient for representing functions that take more than one argument. But we could also express the division function by indexing the argument places as follows:

Q( [_]_i , [_]_j ) = [_]_i / [_]_j

Let F be the function indicated by ‘Sang(  )’. Mary sang, if and only if: F maps the individual Mary onto the value true; i.e., F has the value true given Mary as argument. If Mary (or anyone else) sang, then someone sang. Thus, someone sang if and only if F maps at least one individual onto the value true; or using a modern variant of Frege’s notation, x[Sang(x)]. The quantifier ‘x’ is said to bind the variable ‘x’, which appears in ‘Sang(x)’; and this variable ranges over objects in a domain of discourse. (For now, assume the domain contains only persons.) If everyone sang, then each individual in the domain sang, so F maps each individual on the value true; or using formal notation, x[Sang(x)]. A quantifier binds each occurrence of its variable, as in ‘x[D(x) & C(x)]’, which reflects the logical form of ‘someone is deceitful and clever’. Here the quantifier combines with a conjunction of functions:

[Quantifier]_i [ Predicate([_]_i) & Predicate([_]_i) ]

Just as a single quantifier can bind an unsaturated position associated with a function that takes a single argument, two quantifiers can bind two unsaturated positions associated with a function that takes a pair of arguments. The proposition that everyone trusts everyone, for example, has the following (noncategorical) form: xy[T(x,y)]. Assuming that ‘John’ and ‘Mary’ indicate arguments, it follows that John trusts everyone, and that everyone trusts Mary--i.e., y[T(j,y)] and x[T(x,m)]. It follows from all three propositions that John trusts Mary: T(j,m). Frege’s rule of inference, which captures the key logical role of the universal quantifier, is that one can replace a variable bound by a universal quantifier with a name for some individual in the domain. Similarly, one can replace a name with a variable bound by an existential quantifier. (Schematically: x...x..., so ...n...; ...n..., so x....x....) Given T(j,m), it follows that someone trusts Mary and that John trusts someone: x[T(x, m)]; and x[T(j,x)]. It follows from all three propositions that someone trusts someone: xy[T(x,y)]. (A single quantifier can bind multiple argument positions, as in ‘x[T(x,x)]’; but this means that someone trusts herself.)

Mixed quantification introduces an interesting wrinkle. The propositions indicated by ‘xy[T(x,y)]’ and ‘yx[T(x,y)]’ differ. We can paraphrase the first as ‘there is someone who trusts everyone’ and the second as ‘everyone is trusted by someone or other’; the second follows from the first, but not vice versa. This raises the possibility that ‘someone trusts everyone’ is ambiguous--that it can indicate either of two propositions. (Although this in turn raises difficult questions about what natural
language expressions are, and what it is for an expression to indicate a proposition. But for Frege, the important point was the distinction between the propositions--or thoughts, as he often called them. Similar remarks apply to ‘xy[T(x,y)]’ and ‘yx[T(x,y)]’.) A related phenomenon is exhibited by ‘John danced if Mary sang and Chris slept’. Is the indicated proposition of the form ‘(A if B) and  C’ or ‘A if (B and  C)’? Is someone who says ‘The artist drew a club’ talking about a sketch or a card game? One can use ‘is’ to express identity, as in ‘Hesperus is the planet Venus’; but in ‘Venus is bright’, ‘is’ indicates predication. In ‘Venus is a planet’, ‘a’ is logically inert; yet in ‘John saw a planet’, ‘a’ indicates existential quantification: x[Px & S(j,x)]. (Rendering ‘Venus is a planet’ as ‘x[Px & x = v]’ treats ‘is a planet’ differently than ‘is bright’ by appealing, unnecessarily, to quantification and identity.)

According to Frege, such ambiguities provide further evidence that natural language is not ideally suited to the task of representing propositions and inferential relations perspicuously, and he wanted a language that was up to the task. (Leibniz and others had envisioned a ‘Characteristica Universalis’, but without suggestions for how to proceed beyond syllogistic logic in creating one; and given Frege’s interest in the foundations of arithmetic, he was especially interested in claims, like ‘every number has a successor’.) This is not to say that natural language is ill-suited for other purposes, like communication, or that natural language is useless as a tool for representing propositions. Rather, Frege suggested that natural language is like the eye, whereas a good formal language is like a microscope that reveals structure not otherwise observable.

5. Descriptions and Analysis

In general, if the P is D, it follows that some P is D, and that there is only one (relevant) P. Or put another way: there is a P, and there is at most one P, and it is D. Russell held that the logical form of ‘the boy sang’ reflects these implications: x{Boy(x) & y[Boy(y) x = y] & Sang(x)}. The middle conjunct was Russell’s way of expressing uniqueness; given an object x, ‘y[Boy(y) x = y)]’ says that everything is such that it is a boy if and only if it is identical with x. But however one formulates the middle conjunct, ‘the boy’ does not correspond to any constituent of Russell’s formalism. This reflects his main point: while a speaker may refer to a boy in saying ‘the boy sang’, the boy is not a constituent of the proposition indicated. The proposition has the form of an existential quantification with a bound variable; it does not have the form of a function saturated by an argument--the boy referred to. In this respect, ‘the boy’ is like ‘some boy’; but not even ‘the’ indicates a constituent on Russell’s view.

Natural language can thus mislead us about the constituency of the propositions we assert. Russell went on to apply this point to a now famous puzzle. Even though France is kingless, ‘the king of France is bald’ indicates a proposition; the sentence is not, in that sense, meaningless. If the proposition consists of the function indicated by ‘Bald(  )’ and an argument indicated by ‘the king of France’, there must be an argument so indicated. But what is it? Appeal to nonexistent kings is, to say the least, dubious. Russell concluded that ‘the King of France is bald’ indicates a quantified proposition: x{K(x) & y[K(y) x = y] & B(x). And one should not be led into thinking otherwise by the following spurious reasoning: every proposition is true or false; so the king of France is bald or not; so there is a present king of France (somewhere), and he is either bald or not. For let ‘¶’ stand for the proposition that the king of France is bald. Russell grants that ¶ is true or false. In fact, it is false, since there is no king of France; given ¬x[K(x)], it follows that ¬x{K(x) & y[K(y) x = y] & B(x)}. But it hardly follows that there is a king of France who is either bald or not. Russell thinks the confusion lies in a failure to distinguish the negation of ¶ from: x{K(x) & y[K(y) x = y] & ¬B(x)}; the king of France is not bald. And the natural language expression ‘the king of France is bald or not’ fosters such a confusion.

The idea that philosophical puzzles might dissolve, if only we understood the logical forms of our claims, attracted copious attention. Wittgenstein argued, in his influential Tractatus Logico-Philosophicus, that: (i) the very possibility of meaningful sentences, which can be true or false depending on how the world is, requires propositions with structures of the sort Frege and Russell were getting at; (ii) all propositions are logical compounds of--and thus analyzable into--atomic propositions that are inferentially independent of one another, though even simple natural language sentences may indicate complex propositions; and (iii) the right analyses would, given a little reflection, reveal all philosophical puzzles as confusions about how language is related to the world. Russell never endorsed (iii). But for reasons related to epistemological puzzles, Russell held that we are directly acquainted with the constituents of those propositions into which every proposition (that we can grasp) can be analyzed; we are not directly acquainted with mind-independent objects that cause our various sensory perceptions; and so the apparent referents of proper names (in natural language) are not constituents of basic propositions.

This led Russell to say that such names are disguised descriptions. On this view, ‘Venus’ is associated with a (perhaps complex) predicate, and ‘Venus is bright’ indicates a proposition of the form: x{V(x) & y[V(y) x = y] & B(x)}. This has the tendentious consequence that for some predicate ‘V’, it follows that x[V(x)], if Venus is bright; though perhaps, pace Russell, 3V’ is an unanalyzable predicate true of exactly one mind-indepedent planet. (A related view is that ‘Venus is bright’ shares its logical form, not with ‘The nearest planet is bright’, but with ‘That planet is bright’.)

Questions about names are related to psychological reports, like ‘Mary thinks Venus is bright’, which present puzzles of their own. At least intially, such reports seem to indicate propositions that are neither atomic nor logical compounds of simpler propositions; and as Frege noted in a famous paper, it seems that replacing one name with another name for the same object can affect the truth of a psychological report. If Mary fails to know that Hesperus is Venus, she might think Venus is a planet without thinking Hesperus is a planet; yet any function that has the value true given Venus as argument has the value true given Hesperus as argument. So unsurprisingly, Frege, Russell, and Wittgenstein all held--in varying ways--that psychological reports are misleading with respect to their logical form, since intuitively coreferential names can be associated with distinct propositional contributions. (Wittgenstein later noted that claims like ‘This is red’ and ‘This is yellow’ present difficulties for his view: if the indicated propositions are unanalyzable, and thus logically independent, each should be compatible with the other; yet it is hard to envision any analysis that accounts for the apparent impeccabilty of ‘This is red, so this is not yellow’. This raises questions about whether all inferential security is due to logical form.)

6. Restricted Quantifiers

x[Boy(x) & Sang(x)];
For some x, x is a boy and x sang.

Universal quantifiers can also be restricted, as in ‘x:Boy(x)[Sang(x)]’, which is interpreted as follows: for every x such that Boy(x), x sang; that is, every (individual who is a) boy sang. This is logically equivalent to ‘x[Boy(x) Sang(x)]’; although one might well think the inferential difference between ‘some boy sang’ and ‘every boy sang’ lies entirely with the propositional contributions of ‘some’ and ‘every’--and not (in part) with the contribution of alleged connectives between predicates. Restrictors can be logically complex, as in ‘Some tall boy sang’ or ‘Some boy who respects Mary sang’, which are rendered as ‘x:Tall(x) & Boy(x)[Sang(x)]’ and ‘x:Boy(x) & Respects(x, mary)[Sang(x)]’.

From this perspective, words like ‘someone’, and the grammatical requirement that ‘every’ be followed by a noun (like ‘boy’), reflect the form of those quantifiers that figure in propositions indicated by natural language sentences. Such quantifiers are composed of a determiner, indicated by words like ‘some’ and ‘every’, and a (restricting) predicate that is true of individuals of some sort. One can think of determiners as functions from ordered pairs of predicates to truth values--or equivalently, as functions from predicates to functions from predicates to truth values. This makes explicit that ‘every’ and ‘some’ indicate relations between predicates, much as transitive verbs express relations between individuals.

Let ‘X’ and ‘Y’ be variables ranging over predicates; and let the extension of a predicate be the set of things that the predicate maps onto the value true---intuitively, the set of things the predicate is true of. Then we can say that the function indicated by ‘every’ has the value true given the ordered pair <X, Y> as argument, if and only if: the extension of Y includes the extension of X; or in shorthand, |Y - X| = 0. Similarly, the function indicated by ‘some’ has the value true given the ordered pair <X, Y> as argument, if and only if: the extension of Y overlaps the extension of X; or in shorthand, |Y^X| > 0. At this point, we no longer need the symbols ‘’ and ‘’. For we can say that ‘Every:Boy(x)[Sang(x)]’ is true if and only if the swimmers included the boys; and ‘Some:Boy(x)[Sang(x)]’ is true if and only if the swimmers and the boys overlapped. (Moreover, this not merely a system for rewriting Fregean notation. The truth conditions of ‘Most boys sang’ cannot be captured with Fregean quantifiers and the sentential connectives; but we can say that Most(X, Y) = true if |Y^X| > |Y - X|, and false otherwise.)

The Russellian formula

x{Boy(x) & y[Boy(y) x = y] & Sang(x)}

Some:Boy(x)[Sang(x)] & |Boy| = 1

It is worth noting, briefly, an implication of this point for the inference ‘the boy sang, so some boy sang’. If the logical form of ‘the boy sang’ is ‘Some:Boy(x)[Sang(x)] & |Boy| =1’, then the inference is an instance of the simple schema ‘A & B; so A’. But if the logical form of  ‘the boy sang’ is simply ‘The:Boy(x)[Sang(x)]’, both premise and conclusion of the inference have the same abstract form: Determiner:Boy(x)[Sang(x)]. So the impeccability of the inference would be due to the specific propositional contributions of ‘the’ and ‘some’: if |B^S| > 0 & |B| = 1, then |B^S| > 0. (If the validity of an inference depends solely on the propositional contributions of its logical elements, perhaps ‘the’ indicates a logical element whose relation to the element indicated by ‘some’ can be made explicit.)

7. Transformational Grammar

A leading idea of modern linguistics is that at least some grammatical structures are transformations of other structures; and this is related to the idea that words (and phrases) often appear to be displaced from the positions typically associated with the relevant grammatical roles. For example, the word ‘who’ in (13) is associated with the second (direct object) argument position of the verb ‘saw’:

(13)	Mary wondered who John saw.

(13d)	Mary wondered [John saw who]
(13s)	Mary wondered [ whoi [John saw [_]i ]]

One might also explain the synonymy of (14) and (15), by positing a common deep structure, (14d):

(14)	John seems to like Mary
(14s)	Johni seems ( [_]i to like Mary )
(14d)	Seems(John likes Mary)
(15)	It seems John likes Mary

(16)	John is easy to please.
(17)	John is eager to please

(16s)	Johni is easy [ e to please [_]i ]
(17s)	Johni is eager [ [_]i to please e ]

As an illustration of the kind of data that is relevant, note that (18-20) are perfectly fine expressions of English, while (21) is word salad.

(18)	The boy who sang was happy.
(19)	Was the boy who sang happy.
(20)	The boy who was happy sang.
(21)	*Was the boy who happy sang.

(18d)	{The [boy (who sang)]} [was happy]
(19s)	Wasi <{the [boy (who sang)]} [  [_]i happy ]>
(20d)	{The [boy (who <was happy>)]} sang}
(21s)	*Wasi <{the [boy (who < [_]i happy>)]} sang}>

(22)	The boy who was lost kept crying.
(23)	Was the boy who lost kept crying.

*Was_i <{the [boy (who [_]_i lost)]} [kept crying]}>

(24s)	{(some boy) [trusts (every doctor)]}.
(24LF)	[some boy]i[every doctor]j{ [_]i [ trusts [_]j ]}

[some:boy(x)][every:doctor(y)]{Trusts(x,y)}

[every:doctor(y)][some:boy(x)]{Trusts(x,y)}.

[every doctor]_i[some boy]_j{ [_]_j [ trusts [_]_i ]}

(25)	Every boy saw the doctor who treated himself.
(26)	Every boy saw the doctor who treated him.

[every:boy(x)][the:doctor(y) & treated(y,y)]{saw(x, y)]}

[every:boy(x)][the:doctor(y) & treated(y,x)]{saw(x, y)}

Every boy saw [the doctor]_i who treated [himself]_i
*[Every boy]_i saw the doctor who treated [himself]_i

[Every boy]_i saw the doctor who treated [him]_i
*Every boy saw [the doctor]_i who treated [him]_i

8. Semantic Structure and Events

Davidson and others have urged a version of this idea that draws on Tarski’s development of Frege’s work. Tarski showed how to provide finitely statable interpretations for certain formal languages, which generate arbitrarily many sentences, by employing recursive rules that assign semantic values to every expression of the language given assignments of semantic values to primitive elements of the language. (This is related to the idea that an inference is valid if and only if: every interpretation that makes the premises true makes the conclusion true, holding fixed the interpretations of logical elements like ‘if’ and ‘every’.) Davidsonians try to construct Tarski-style theories that assign truth conditions to natural language sentences, given the extensions of words and the relevant logical forms. For on their view, a sentence S means that p, if a recursive theory of the right sort assigns the following truth conditions to S: true if p, and false otherwise. (Montague and others have pursued a similar line of thought.)

For present purposes, the details of this program are less important than Davidson’s claim that in constructing any such theory of meaning, we should attend to inferential relations like those exhibited in

(27)	Juliet kissed Romeo quickly at midnight.
(28)	Juliet kissed Romeo quickly.
(29)	Juliet kissed Romeo at midnight.
(30)	Juliet kissed Romeo.

The true form of (30) is said to be manifested by the paraphrase ‘there was a kissing of Romeo by Juliet’. One can formalize this proposal in various ways: e[Kissing(e) & Of(e, Romeo) & By(e, Juliet)]; or e[Kiss(e, Juliet, Romeo)], with the verb ‘kiss’ indicating a function that takes three arguments; or

(30)	e[Agent(e, Juliet) & Kissing(e) & Patient(e, Romeo)]

(27a)	e[Agent(e, Juliet) & Kissing(e) & Patient(e, Romeo) & Quick(e) & At-midnight(e)]
(28a)	e[Agent(e, Juliet) & Kissing(e) & Patient(e, Romeo) & Quick(e)]
(29a)	e[Agent(e, Juliet) & Kissing(e) & Patient(e, Romeo) & At-midnight(e)]

e[A(e, x) & K(e) & P(e, y) & Q(e) & M(e)],
therefore e[A(e, x) & K(e) & P(e, y)]

Bibliography

• Kneale, W. & Kneale, M. 1962: The Development of Logic. Oxford: OUP, reprinted 1984.
• Sainsbury, M. 1991: Logical Forms. Oxford: Blackwell.
• Broadie, A. 1987: Introduction to Medieval Logic. Oxford: OUP.

• From Frege to Gödel, J. van Heijenoort, ed. Cambridge, MA: Harvard, 1967.

• Translations from the Philosophical Writings of Gottlob Frege, P. Geach & M. Black (trans.), Oxford: Blackwell, 1952.

• Introduction to Mathematical Philosophy (London: George Allen and Unwin, 1919)
• Our Knowledge of the External World (New York: Norton, 1929)
• The Philosophy of Logical Atomism (La Salle, Ill: Open Court, 1985).

Two key articles on restricted quantifiers, and a third reviewing recent work, are:

• Barwise, J. & Cooper, R. 1981: Generalized Quantifiers and Natural Language. Linguistics and Philosophy 4: 159-219.
• Higginbotham, J. & May, R. 1981: Questions, Quantifiers, and Crossing. Linguistic Review 1: 47-79.
• Keenan, E. 1996: The Semantics of Determiners. In S. Lappin, ed., The Handbook of Contemporary Semantic Theory, Oxford: Blackwell

• Radford, A., 1988: Transformational Grammar. Cambridge: CUP.
• Haegeman, L. 1994: Introduction to Government & Binding Theory. Cambridge: Blackwell.
• Chomsky, N. 1986: Knowledge of Language. New York: Praeger.

• Higginbotham, J. 1985: On Semantics. Linguistic Inquiry: 16 547-93.
• Hornstein, N. 1995: Logical Form: From GB to Minimalism. Oxford: Blackwell.
• Larson, R. and Segal, G. 1995: Knowledge of Meaning. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
• May, R. 1985: Logical Form: Its Structure and Derivation. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
• Neale, S. 1993: Grammatical Form, Logical Form, and Incomplete Symbols. In A. Irvine & G. Wedeking, eds., Russell and Analytic Philosophy Toronto: University of Toronto.

• Davidson, D. 1984: Essays on Truth and Interpretation. Oxford: OUP.
• Davidson, D. 1967: The Logical Form of Action Sentences. In his Essays on Actions and Events, Oxford: OUP, 1984.
• Davidson, D. 1985: Adverbs of Action. In B. Vermazen and M. Hintikka, eds., Essays on Davidson: Actions and Events, Oxford: Clarendon Press
• Evans, G. & McDowell, J. (eds.) 1976: Truth and Meaning. Oxford: OUP.
• Higginbotham, J. 1986: Davidson’s Program in Semantics.  In E. Lepore, ed., Truth and Interpretation (Oxford: Blackwell).
• Lycan, W. 1984: Logical Form in Natural Language. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
• Parsons, T. 1990: Events in the Semantics of English Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
• Schein, B. 1993: Plurals. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
• Taylor, B. 1985: Modes of Occurrence. Oxford: Blackwell.

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First published: October 19, 1999
Content last modified: October 19, 1999