Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Supplement to Prisoner’s Dilemma
Stability Concepts in Evolutionary Games
Logical relations among concepts of stability used in discussions of
the EPD and other evolutionary games are established in a series of
papers by Bendor and Swistak. Some conditions on game payoffs and some
conditions on the course of evolution are described below. Logical
relations among these conditions are represented in the diagram that
follows.
Conditions on payoffs
(V(i,j) is the total payoff that i gets playing against j.)
| CS |
Axelrod ("Collective Stability") |
 |
| MS |
Maynard Smith |
 |
| BL |
Boyd and Lorberbaum |
 |
| BS |
Bendor and Swistak |
 |
Conditions on the course of evolution
u and r ("universal" and restricted) indicates that the condition
obtains under any rule of evolution or merely under the replication
dynamics. s and w ("strong" and "weak") indicate that the strategy
eradicates invasions or merely survives them. d and f ("durable" and
"fragile") indicate that the condition applies to invasions of any
size or to sufficiently small invasions. For example i has uwd
(universal weak durable) stability if, under any rule of evolution, it
survives invasions of any size. The properties referred to as
strong stability and weak stability in the body of the
entry are rsf stability and rwf stability, respectively.
Relations among stability conditions
Logical implications are indicated by chains of arrows (and by
relative vertical position). Conditions stronger than # cannot be
satisfied by any EPD and conditions weaker than * are satisfied by
EPDs with all levels of cooperation from 0% to 100%.
Copyright © 1997 by
Steven T. Kuhn
kuhns@georgetown.edu
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First published: September 4, 1997
Content last modified: September 4, 1997