Notes

1. Let I be an interpretation function with respect to a model, so that I(a) is the individual I assigns to the individual constant ‘a’, I(Fⁿ) is the n-place relation that I assigns to n-place predicate Fⁿ. Then for all n-place predicates ‘Fⁿ’ and individuals constants ‘c₁’, ..., ‘c_n’, the sentence ‘Fⁿc₁...c_n’ is true in the interpretation just in case < I(c₁), ..., I(c_n)> ext(I(Fⁿ)). We would relativize this clause to variable assignments in the usual way to define satisfaction conditions for atomic sentences.

2. More generally, if is a formula with free occurrences of exactly the variables v₁, ..., v_n, then ‘[v₁,..., v_n ]’ is an n-place complex predicate (normal quotation marks are used here as stand-ins for quasi-quotation). In more complicated applications we could allow to contain no free variables (in which case ‘[ ]’ denotes the proposition that-) or more free variables than are bound by the -operator (to allow expressions like ‘[x Fxyz]’, which we could quantify into, as with ‘y([x Fxyz])’.

3. A standard sort of comprehension schema holds that for each open formula , Xⁿx₁...x_n(Xⁿx₁...x_n if and only if ).

First published: September 23, 1999
Content last modified: September 23, 1999