Everett’s Relative-State Formulation of Quantum Mechanics

• Introduction
• The Measurement Problem
• Everett’s Proposal
• The Bare Theory
• Many Worlds
• Many Minds
• Many Histories
• Relative Facts
• Summary
• Bibliography
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

Introduction

Everett’s no-collapse formulation of quantum mechanics was a reaction to problems that arise in the standard von Neumann-Dirac collapse theory. Everett’s proposal was to drop the collapse postulate from the standard theory, then deduce the empirical predictions of the standard theory as the subjective experiences of observers who are themselves treated as physical systems described by his theory. It is, however, unclear precisely how Everett intended for this to work. Consequently, there have been many, mutually incompatible, attempts at trying to explain what he in fact had in mind. Indeed, it is probably fair to say that most no-collapse interpretations of quantum mechanics have at one time or another been attributed to Everett.

In what follows, I will describe Everett’s worry about the standard collapse formulation of quantum mechanics and his proposal for solving the problem as it is presented in his 1957 paper. I will then very briefly describe a few approaches to interpreting Everett’s theory.

The Measurement Problem

In order to understand what Everett was worried about, one must first understand how the standard theory works. The standard von Neumann-Dirac theory is based on the following principles (see von Neumann 1955):

1. Representation of States: The possible physical states of a system S are represented by the unit-length vectors in a Hilbert space (which for present purposes one may regard as a vector space with an inner product). The physical state at a time is then represented by a single vector in the Hilbert space.

2. Representation of Properties: For each physical property P that one might observe of a system S there is an operator P (on the vectors that represent the possible states of S) that represents the property (in a way determined by the following principle).

3. Eigenvalue-Eigenstate Link: A system S determinately has physical property P if and only if P operating on S (the vector representing S’s state) yields S. We say then that S is in an eigenstate of P with eigenvalue 1. S determinately does not have property P if and only if P operating on S yields 0.

4. Dynamics: (a). If no measurement is made, then a system evolves continuously according to the linear, deterministic Schroedinger dynamics, which depends only on the energy properties of the system. (b). If a measurement is made, then the system instantaneously and randomly jumps to a state where it either determinately has or determinately does not have the property being measured (according to the eigenvalue-eigenstate link). The probability of each possible post-measurement state is determined by the system’s initial state.

But what does it take for an interaction to count as a measurement? Unless we know this, the standard theory is at best incomplete, since we do not know when each dynamical law obtains. Moreover, and this is what worried Everett, if we suppose that observers and their measuring devices are constructed from simpler systems that each obey the deterministic dynamics, then the composite systems, the observers and their measuring devices, must evolve in a continuous deterministic way, and nothing like the random, discontinuous evolution described by rule 4b can ever occur. That is, if observers and their measuring devices are understood as being constructed of simpler systems each behaving as quantum mechanics requires (each obeying 4a), then the standard theory is logically inconsistent since it says that together the systems must obey 4b. In order to preserve the consistency of the theory, Everett concluded that the standard theory cannot be used to describe systems that contain observers--it can only be used to describe systems where all observers are external to the described system. This restriction on the applicability of the theory was unacceptable. Everett wanted a theory that could be applied to any physical system whatsoever, one that described observers and their measuring devices the same way that it described every other physical system.

Everett’s Proposal

This is what Everett says: "We shall be able to introduce into [the relative-state theory] systems which represent observers. Such systems can be conceived as automatically functioning machines (servomechanisms) possessing recording devices (memory) and which are capable of responding to their environment. The behavior of these observers shall always be treated within the framework of wave mechanics. Furthermore, we shall deduce the probabilistic assertions of Process 1 [rule 4b] as subjective appearances to such observers, thus placing the theory in correspondence with experience. We are then led to the novel situation in which the formal theory is objectively continuous and causal, while subjectively discontinuous and probabilistic. While this point of view thus shall ultimately justify our use of the statistical assertions of the orthodox view, it enables us to do so in a logically consistent manner, allowing for the existence of other observers." (1973, 9)

Everett’s goal then was to show that the memory records of an observer as described by his no-collapse theory would match those predicted by the standard theory with the collapse dynamics. The main problem in understanding what Everett had in mind is in figuring out how this correspondence between the predictions of the two theories was supposed to work.

Suppose that J is a good observer who measures the x-spin of a spin-1/2 system S (spin is a property of fundamental particles and other quantum-mechanical systems; if one specifies a particular axis (like x or z), then a spin-1/2 system will be found, on measurement, to be either "spin up" or "spin down" with respect to the particular axis). For Everett, being a good x-spin observer means that J has the following two dispositions (the arrows below represent the time-evolution described by the deterministic dynamics 4a):

Now consider what happens when J observes the x-spin of a system that begins in a superposition of x-spin eigenstates:

Everett confesses that such a post-measurement state is puzzling: "As a result of the interaction the state of the measuring apparatus is no longer capable of independent definition. It can be defined only relative to the state of the object system. In other words, there exists only a correlation between the states of the two systems. It seems as if nothing can ever be settled by such a measurement." (1957b, 318)

And he describes the problem he faces: "This indefinite behavior seems to be quite at variance with our observations, since physical objects always appear to us to have definite positions. Can we reconcile this feature of wave mechanical theory built purely on [rule 4a] with experience, or must the theory be abandoned as untenable? In order to answer this question we consider the problem of observation itself within the framework of the theory." (1957b, 318)

Then he describes his solution to the determinate-experience problem: "Let one regard an observer as a subsystem of the composite system: observer + object-system. It is then an inescapable consequence that after the interaction has taken place there will not, generally, exist a single observer state. There will, however, be a superposition of the composite system states, each element of which contains a definite observer state and a definite relative object-system state. Furthermore, as we shall see, each of these relative object system states will be, approximately, the eigenstates of the observation corresponding to the value obtained by the observer which is described by the same element of the superposition. Thus, each element of the resulting superposition describes an observer who perceived a definite and generally different result, and to whom it appears that the object-system state has been transformed into the corresponding eigenstate. In this sense the usual assertions of [the collapse dynamics (4b)] appear to hold on a subjective level to each observer described by an element of the superposition. We shall also see that correlation plays an important role in preserving consistency when several observers are present and allowed to interact with one another (to ‘consult’ one another) as well as with other object-systems." (1973, 10)

Everett presents a principle of the fundamental relativity of states: one can say that in state E, J recorded "x-spin up" relative to S being in the x-spin up state and that J recorded "x-spin down" relative to S being in the x-spin down state. But note that this principle alone does not allow Everett to deduce anything like the experiences predicted by the standard collapse theory. The standard theory predicts that on measurement the quantum-mechanical state of the composite system will collapse to either:

The problem is that there is a gap in Everett’s exposition between what he sets out to explain (why observers have precisely the same experiences as predicted by the standard theory) and what he ultimately ends up saying. Since it is unclear exactly how he intends for his theory to explain an observer’s (apparently?) determinate measurement records, it is also unclear how he intends to explain why one should expect one’s determinate measurement records to exhibit the standard quantum statistics. This gap in Everett’s exposition has led to the many mutually incompatible reconstructions of his theory--each can be taken as presenting a different way of explaining how one’s records can be determinate (or at least appear to be determinate) in a post-measurement state like E.

The Bare Theory

So how does the bare theory account for J’s determinate experience? The short answer is that it doesn’t. Rather, on the bare theory, one tries to explain why J would falsely believe that he has an ordinary determinate measurement record. The trick is to ask the observer not what result he got, but rather whether he got some specific determinate result. If the post-measurement state was:

The idea is to try to account for all of J’s beliefs about his determinate experiences by appealing to such illusions. Rather than predicting the experiences that we believe that we have, a proponent of the bare theory tells us that we do not have many determinate beliefs at all and then tries to explain why we nonetheless determinately believe that we do.

While one can tell several suggestive stories about the sort of illusions that an observer would experience, there are at least two serious problems with the bare theory. One problem is that the bare theory is not empirically coherent: that is, if the bare theory were true, it would be impossible to ever have empirical evidence for accepting it as true. Another is that if the bare theory were true, one would most likely fail to have any determinate beliefs at all (since on the deterministic dynamics one would almost never expect that the global state was an eigenstate of any particular observer being sentient), which is presumably not the sort of prediction one looks for in a successful physical theory (for more details on how experience is supposed to work in the bare theory and some the problems it encounters see Bub, Clifton, and Monton 1998 and Barrett 1994 and 1998).

Many Worlds

DeWitt and Graham describe their reading of Everett as follows: "[Everett’s interpretation of quantum mechanics] denies the existence of a separate classical realm and asserts that it makes sense to talk about a state vector for the whole universe. This state vector never collapses and hence reality as a whole is rigorously deterministic. This reality, which is described jointly by the dynamical variables and the state vector, is not the reality we customarily think of, but is a reality composed of many worlds. By virtue of the temporal development of the dynamical variables the state vector decomposes naturally into orthogonal vectors, reflecting a continual splitting of the universe into a multitude of mutually unobservable but equally real worlds, in each of which every good measurement has yielded a definite result and in most of which the familiar statistical quantum laws hold." (1973, v)

DeWitt admits that this constant splitting of worlds whenever the states of systems become correlated is counterintuitive: "I still recall vividly the shock I experienced on first encountering this multiworld concept. The idea of 10^100 slightly imperfect copies of oneself all constantly spitting into further copies, which ultimately become unrecognizable, is not easy to reconcile with common sense. Here is schizophrenia with a vengeance." (1973, 161)

But while the theory is counterintuitive, it does (unlike the bare theory) explain why observers end up recording determinate measurement results. In the state described by E there are two observers each occupying a different world and each with a perfectly determinate measurement record. There are, however, other problems with the many-worlds theory.

A standard complaint is that the theory is ontologically extravagant. One would presumably only ever need one physical world, our world, to account for our experience. The idea behind postulating the actual existence of a different physical world corresponding to each term in the quantum-mechanical state is that is allows one to explain our determinate experiences while taking the deterministically-evolving quantum-mechanical state to be in some sense a complete and accurate description of the physical facts. But again one might wonder whether the sort of completeness one gets warrants the vast ontology of worlds.

Perhaps more serious, in order to explain our determinate measurement records, the theory requires one to choose a preferred basis so that observers have determinate records (or better, determinate experiences) in each term of the quantum-mechanical state as expressed in this basis. The problem is that not just any old preferred basis will do this--indeed, we presumably do not know what basis would make our experiences and beliefs determinate in every world. Indeed, the right preferred basis would presumably depend on such things as our physiology and experimental practice, so even if we did know which one to choose, this choice of a fundamental part of our most basic physical theory (the part that tells us when worlds split) would have to be contingent on accidents of biology and practice. We tend to think that our physical laws are independent of such accidental features of the world.

Another problem concerns the statistical predictions of the theory. The standard collapse theory predicts that J will get the result "spin up" with probability a-squared and "spin down" with probability b-squared in the above experiment. But the many-worlds theory cannot, as it stands, make any statistical predictions concerning an observer’s future experiences. Indeed, the question "What is the probability that J will record the result ‘spin up’?" is strictly nonsense since one cannot identify which of the two future observers is J. The upshot is that one cannot capture the standard probabilistic predictions of quantum mechanics. And the moral is that if one does not have transtemporal identity of observers in a theory, then one cannot assign probabilities to their future experiences.

Many Minds

Perhaps the oddest thing about this theory is that in order to get the observer’s mental state in some way to supervene on his physical state, Albert and Loewer associate with each observer a continuous infinity of minds. The physical state always evolves in the usual deterministic way, but each mind evolves randomly (with probabilities determined by the particular mind’s current mental state and the evolution of the global quantum-mechanical state). On the mental dynamics that they describe, one would expect a-squared of J’s minds to end up associated with the result "spin up" (the first term of E) and b-squared of J’s minds to end up associated with the result "spin down" (the second term of E). The mental dynamics is also stipulated to be memory preserving.

An advantage of this theory over the many-worlds theory is that there is no physically preferred basis. To be sure, one must choose a preferred basis in order to specify the mental dynamics completely (something that Albert and Loewer never completely specify), but as Albert and Loewer point out, this choice has absolutely nothing to do with any physical facts; rather, it can be thought of as part of the description of the relationship between physical and mental states. Another advantage of the many-minds theory is that, unlike the many-worlds theory, it really does make the usual probabilistic predictions for the future experiences of a particular mind (this, of course, requires that one take the minds to have transtemporal identities, which Albert and Loewer do as part of their unabashed commitment to a strong mind-body dualism).

The main problems with the many-minds theory concern its commitment to a strong mind-body dualism and the question of whether the sort of mental supervenience one gets is worth the trouble of postulating a continuous infinity of minds associated with each observer. Concerning the latter, one might well conclude that a single-mind theory would be preferable (see Barrett 1995).

Many Histories

One problem concerns whether and in what sense environmental interactions can select a physically preferred basis for the entire universe, which is what we presumably need in order to make sense of Everett’s formulation. After all, in order to be involved in environmental interactions a system must have an environment, and the universe, by definition, has no environment. Another problem is that it is unclear that the environment-selected determinate quantity at a time is a quantity that would explain our determinate measurement records and experience. Proponents who argue for this approach often appeal to biological or evolutionary arguments to justify the assumption that sentient beings must record their beliefs in terms of the environment-selected (or decohering) physical properties (see Gell-Mann and Hartle 1990 and Zurek 1991 for this sort of argument). The short story is that it is not yet clear how the account of our determinate experience is suppose to work when one relies on decoherence to select a preferred basis (see Dowker and Kent 1996 for an extended discussion of some of the problems one encounters in such an approach).

If one allows oneself the luxury of stipulating a preferred basis (a basis where every observer’s measurement records are determinate), one can construct a many-histories theory from Albert and Loewer’s many-minds theory. One might, for example, take the trajectory of each of an observer’s minds to describe the history of a possible physical world. One might then stipulate a measure over the set of all possible histories (trajectories) that would represent the prior probability of each history being ours. Note that since such worlds (and everything in them) would have transtemporal identities, unlike the many-worlds theory, there would be no special problem here in talking about probabilities concerning one’s future experience--the quantum probabilities in such a theory might naturally be interpreted as epistemic probabilities.

Relative Facts

So how do we account for our determinate experience? On this approach, one simply denies that there is any simple matter of fact concerning what an observer’s experience is. Which means, of course, that insofar as one believes that there really is a simple matter of fact about what one’s experiences is, the relative-fact theory provides no account of one’s experience. Similarly, one cannot make sense of the usual statistical predictions of quantum mechanics insofar as one takes these to be predictions concerning the probability that a particular measurement outcome will in fact occur. Again, there are typically no such simple facts in such a theory.

It has been argued that since there is no simple matter of fact concerning whether a particular event does or does not occur, quantum mechanics (in fact?) concerns only the probabilistic correlations between events. It seems to me, however, that any coherent talk about the probabilistic correlations between events presupposes that there are determinate matters of fact concerning what events occur (otherwise what are the probabilities probabilities of?).

Summary

Bibliography

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First published: June 3, 1998
Content last modified: June 3, 1998