Notes

1. Exactly when the discovery of the paradox took place is not completely clear. Russell initially states that he came across the paradox "in June 1901". (See "My Mental Development", in Paul Arthur Schilpp, The Philosophy of Bertrand Russell, 3rd edn, New York: Tudor, 1951, p. 13.) Later he reports that the discovery took place "in the spring of 1901". (See My Philosophical Development, London and New York: Routledge, 1995, p. 58.) Later still he reports that he came across the paradox, not in June, but in May of that year. (See The Autobiography of Bertrand Russell, vol. 1, Boston and Toronto: Little, Brown and Company, 1969, p. 221.)

2. Gottlob Frege, "The Russell Paradox", in The Basic Laws of Arithmetic, Berkeley and Los Angeles: University of California Press, 1964, p. 127. Reprinted in A.D. Irvine, Bertrand Russell: Critical Assessments, vol. 2, London: Routledge, 1999, p. 1.

First published: June 11, 2001
Content last modified: June 11, 2001