Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Supplement to Actualism
Why NE and CBF Are Harmless Consequences of SQML
To see in more detail why the Necessary Existence theorem (NE) of
SQML is a harmless consequence of SQML, note that, according to new
actualism, Socrates does exist necessarily, but since he is not
necessarily concrete, NE does not imply that Socrates is a
"necessary being". As we saw above, Socrates' contingency lies in
the fact that he is concrete at some possible worlds and nonconcrete
at others. Necessary beings, by contrast, are objects that are
either concrete at every possible world (like Spinoza's God) or
nonconcrete at every possible world (like numbers, sets, etc.). This
means that the "contingently nonconcrete" are aptly named, since they
are not necessary beings in either of these senses. So the claim
that "Everything necessarily exists" (NE), does not conflict with our
intuition that some beings are contingent, once the notion of what it
is to be contingent is properly understood. Nor does its
necessitation NNE. So if NE and NNE are acceptable consequences of
SQML, the worry about the Converse Barcan Formula (CBF) disappears as
well, for the fact that it, together with Serious Actualism (SA),
implies NE, is of little consequence.
Copyright © 2000 by
Christopher Menzel
cmenzel@tamu.edu
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First published: June 16, 2000
Content last modified: June 16, 2000