Classical Logic

The following sections provide the basics of a typical logic, sometimes called "classical elementary logic" or "classical first-order logic". Section 2 develops a formal language, with a rigorous syntax and grammar. The formal language is a recursively defined collection of strings on a fixed alphabet. As such, it has no meaning, or perhaps better, the meaning of the formulas is given by the deductive system and the semantics. Some of the symbols have counterparts in ordinary language. We define an argument to be a non-empty collection of formulas in the formal language, one of which is designated to be the conclusion. The other formulas (if any) in an argument are its premises. Section 3 sets up a deductive system for the language, in the spirit of natural deduction. An argument is derivable is there is a deduction from some of its premises to its conclusion. Section 4 provides a model-theoretic semantics. An argument is valid if there is no interpretation (in the semantics) in which its premises are all true and its conclusion false. This reflects the longstanding view that a valid argument is truth-preserving.

In Section 5, we turn to relationships between the deductive system and the semantics, and in particular, the relationship between derivability and validity. We show that an argument is derivable only if it is valid. This pleasant feature, called soundness, entails that no deduction takes one from true premises to a false conclusion. Thus, deductions preserve truth, and there aren't too many deductions. Then we establish a converse, called completeness, that an argument is valid only if it is derivable. This establishes that the deductive system is rich enough to provide a deduction for every valid argument. There are enough deductions. All and only valid arguments are derivable. We briefly indicate other features of the logic, some of which are corollaries to soundness and completeness.

• 1. Introduction
• 2. Language
• 3. Deduction
• 4. Semantics
• 5. Meta-theory
• Bibliography
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

1. Introduction

Typically, ordinary reasoning takes place in a natural language, or perhaps a natural language augmented with some mathematical symbols. So our question begins with the relationship between a natural language and a formal language. Without attempting to be comprehensive, it may help to sketch several options on this matter.

One view is that the formal languages accurately exhibit actual features of certain fragments of a natural language. Some philosophers claim that declarative sentences of natural language have underlying logical forms and that these forms are displayed by formulas of a formal language. Other writers hold that (successful) declarative sentences express propositions; and formulas of formal languages somehow display the forms of these propositions. On views like this, the components of a logic provide the underlying deep structure of correct reasoning. A chunk of reasoning in natural language is correct if the forms underlying the sentences constitute a valid or deducible argument. See for example, Montague [1974], Davidson [1984], Lycan [1984].

Another view, held at least in part by Gottlob Frege and Wilhelm Leibniz, is that because natural languages are vague and ambiguous, they should be replaced by formal languages. A similar view, held by W. V. O. Quine (e.g., [1960], [1986]), is that a natural language should be regimented, cleaned up for serious scientific and metaphysical work. One desideratum of the enterprise is that the logical structures in the regimented language should be transparent. It should be easy to "read off" the logical properties of each sentence. A regimented language is similar to a formal language regarding, for example, the explicitly presented rigor of its syntax and its truth conditions.

On a view like this, deducibility and validity represent idealizations of correct reasoning in natural language. A chunk of reasoning is correct to the extent that it corresponds to, or can be regimented by, a valid or deducible argument in a formal language.

When mathematicians and many philosophers reason, they occasionally invoke formulas in a formal language to help disambiguate, or otherwise clarify what they mean. In other words, sometimes formulas in a formal language are used in ordinary reasoning. This suggests that one might think of a formal language as an addendum to a natural language. Then our present question concerns the relationship between this addendum and the original language. What do deducibility and validity, as sharply defined on the addendum, tell us about correct reasoning in general?

Another view is that a formal language is a mathematical model of a natural language in roughly the same sense as, say, a collection of point masses is a model of a system of physical objects, and the Bohr construction is a model of an atom. In other words, a formal language displays certain features of natural languages, or idealizations thereof, while ignoring or simplifying other features. The purpose of mathematical models is to shed light on what they are models of, without claiming that the model is accurate in all respects or that the model should replace what it is a model of. On a view like this, deducibility and validity represent mathematical models of (perhaps different aspects of) correct reasoning in natural languages. Correct chunks of reasoning correspond, more or less, to valid or deducible arguments; incorrect chunks of reasoning roughly correspond to invalid or non-deducible arguments. See, for example, Corcoran [1973] or Shapiro [1998].

There is no need to adjudicate this matter here. Perhaps the truth lies in a combination of the above options, or maybe some other option is the correct, or most illuminating one. I raise the matter only to lend some philosophical perspective to the formal treatment that follows.

2. Language

Building blocks

a, a₁, b₂₃, c, d₂₂, etc.

We also assume a stock of individual variables. These are lower-case letters, near the end of the alphabet, with out without numerical subscripts:

w, x, y₁₂, z, z₄, etc.

Constants and variables are the only terms in our formal language, so all of our terms are simple, corresponding to proper names and pronouns. Some authors also introduce function letters, which allow complex terms corresponding to: "7+4" and "the wife of Bill Clinton", or complex terms containing variables, like "the father of x" and "x/y". Logic books aimed at mathematicians are likely to contain function letters, probably due to the centrality of functions to mathematical discourse. Books aimed at a more general audience (or at philosophy students), may leave out function letters, since it simplifies the syntax and theory. We follow the latter route here. This is an instance of a general tradeoff between presenting a system with greater expressive resources, at the cost of making its formal treatment more complex.

For each natural number n, we introduce a stock of n-place predicate letters. These are upper-case letters at the beginning or middle of the alphabet. A superscript indicates the number of places, and there may or may not be a subscript. For example,

A³, B³₂, P³, etc.

Zero-place predicate letters are sometimes called "sentence letters". They correspond to free-standing sentences whose internal structure does not matter. One-place predicate letters, called "monadic predicate letters", correspond to linguistic items denoting properties, like "being a man", "being red", or "being a prime number". Two-place predicate letters, "binary predicate letters", correspond to linguistic items denoting binary relations, like "is a parent of" or "is greater than". Three-place predicate letters correspond to three-place relations, like "lies on a straight line between". And so on.

The non-logical terminology of the language consists of its individual constants and predicate letters. The symbol "=", for identity, is not a non-logical symbol. In taking identity to be logical, we provide explicit treatment for it in the deductive system and the model-theoretic semantics. Most authors do the same, but there is some controversy over the issue (Quine [1986, Chapter 5]). If K is a set of constants and predicate letters, then we give the fundamentals of a language 1K= built on this set of non-logical terminology. It may be called the first-order language with identity on K. A similar language that lacks the symbol for identity (or which takes identity to be non-logical) may be called 1K, first-order logic without identity.

Atomic formulas

P⁴xaab, C¹x, C¹a, D⁰, A³abc.

If an atomic formula has no variables, then it is called an atomic sentence. If it does have variables, it is called an open formula. In the above list of examples, the first and second are open; the rest are sentences.

Compound formulas

¬, &, , , , , (, )

1. All atomic formulas of 1K= are formulas of 1K=.

2. If is a formula of 1K=, then so is ¬.

3. If and are formulas of 1K=, then so is ( & ).

4. If and are formulas of 1K=, then so is ( ).

5. If and are formulas of 1K=, then so is ( ).

The arrow "" corresponds to "if . . . then . . . ", so ( ) can be read "if then " or " only if ".

The symbols "&", "", and "" are called "binary connectives", since they serve to "connect" two sentences into one. Some authors introduce ( ) as an abbreviation of (( ) & ( )). The symbol "" is an analogue of the locution "if and only if".

6. If is a formula of 1K= and v is a variable, then v is a formula of 1K=.

7. If is a formula of 1K= and v is a variable, then v is a formula of 1K=.

8. That's all folks. That is, all formulas are constructed in accordance with rules (1)-(7).

We next define the notion of an occurrence of a variable being free or bound in a formula. All variables that occur in an atomic formula are free. If a variable occurs free (or bound) in or in , then that same occurrence is free (or bound) in ¬, ( & ), ( ), and ( ). That is, the (unary and binary) connectives do not change the status of variables that occur in them. All occurrences of the variable v in are bound in v and v . Any free occurrences of v in are bound by the initial quantifier. All other variables that occur in are free or bound in v and v , as they are in . A variable that immediately follows a quantifier (as in "x" and "y") is neither free nor bound. We do not think of those as occurrences of the variable.

For example, in the formula (x(Axy Bx) & Bx), the occurrences of "x" in Axy and in the first Bx are bound by the quantifier. The occurrence of "y" and last occurrence of "x" are free. In x(Ax xBx), the "x" in Ax is bound by the initial universal quantifier, while the other occurrence of x is bound by the existential quantifier. The above syntax allows this "overlap" of bound variables, and it does not create an ambiguity, but we will avoid such formulas, as a matter of taste and clarity

Free variables correspond to place-holders, while bound variables are used to express generality. If a formula has no free variables, then it is called a sentence. If a formula has free variables, it is called open.

Features of the syntax

We assume at the outset that all of the categories are disjoint. For example, no connective is also a quantifier or a variable, and the non-logical terms are not also parentheses or connectives. Also, the items within each category are distinct. For example, the sign for disjunction does not do double-duty as the negation symbol, and perhaps more significantly, no two-place predicate is also a one-place predicate.

Theorem 1. Every formula of 1K= has the same number of left and right parentheses. Moreover, each left parenthesis corresponds to a unique right parenthesis, which occurs to the right of the left parenthesis. Similarly, each right parenthesis corresponds to a unique left parenthesis, which occurs to the left of the given right parenthesis. If a parenthesis occurs between a matched pair of parentheses, then its mate also occurs within that matched pair. In other words, parentheses that occur within a matched pair are themselves matched.

Proof: By clause (8), every formula is built up from the atomic formulas using clauses (2)-(7). The atomic formulas have no parentheses (by the policy that the categories are disjoint). Parentheses are introduced only in clauses (3)-(5), and each time they are introduced as a matched set. So at any stage in the construction of a formula, the parentheses are paired off.

John is married, and Mary is single, or Joe is crazy.

Can we be sure that there are no other amphibolies in our language? That is, can we be sure that each formula of 1K= can be put together in only one way? Showing this is our next task.

Let us temporarily use the term "unary marker" for the negation symbol (¬) or a quantifier followed by a variable (e.g., x, z).

Lemma 2. Each formula consists of a string of zero or more unary markers followed by either an atomic formula or a formula produced using a binary connective, via one of clauses (3)-(5).

Proof: We proceed by induction on the complexity of the formula or, in other words, on the number of formation rules that are applied. The Lemma clearly holds for atomic formulas. Let n be a natural number, and suppose that the Lemma holds for any formula constructed from n or fewer instances of clauses (2)-(7). Let be a formula constructed from n+1 instances. The Lemma holds if the last clause used to construct was either (3), (4), or (5). If the last clause used to construct was (2), then is ¬. Since was constructed with n instances of the rule, the Lemma holds for (by the induction hypothesis), and so it holds for . Similar reasoning shows the Lemma to hold for if the last clause was (6) or (7). By clause (8), this exhausts the cases, and so the Lemma holds for , by induction.

Lemma 3. If a formula contains a left parenthesis, then it ends with a right parenthesis, which matches the leftmost left parenthesis in .

Proof: Here we also proceed by induction on the number of instances of (2)-(7) used to construct the formula. Clearly, the Lemma holds for atomic formulas, since they have no parentheses. Suppose, then, that the Lemma holds for formulas constructed with n or fewer instances of (2)-(7), and let be constructed with n+1 instances. If the last clause applied was (3)-(5), then the Lemma holds since itself begins with a left parenthesis and ends with the matching right parenthesis. If the last clause applied was (2), then is ¬, and the induction hypothesis applies to . Similarly, if the last clause applied was (6) or (7), then consists of a quantifier, a variable, and a formula to which we can apply the induction hypothesis. It follows that the Lemma holds for .

Lemma 4. Each formula contains at least one atomic formula.

Theorem 5. Let , be nonempty sequences of characters on our alphabet, such that (i.e followed by ) is a formula. Then is not a formula.

Proof: By Theorem 1 and Lemma 3, if contains a left parenthesis, then the right parenthesis that matches the leftmost left parenthesis in comes at the end of , and so the matching right parenthesis is in . So, has more left parentheses than right parentheses. By Theorem 1, is not a formula. So now suppose that does not contain any left parentheses. By Lemma 2, consists of a string of zero or more unary markers followed by either an atomic formula or a formula produced using a binary connective, via one of clauses (3)-(5). If the latter formula was produced via one of clauses (3)-(5), then it begins with a left parenthesis. Since does not contain any parentheses, it must be a string of unary markers. But then does not contain any atomic formulas, and so by Lemma 4, is not a formula. The only case left is where consists of a string of unary markers followed by an atomic formula, either in the form t₁=t₂ or Pt₁ . . . t_n. Again, if just consisted of unary markers, it would not be a formula, and so must consist of the unary markers that start , followed by either t₁ by itself, t₁= by itself, or the predicate letter P, and perhaps some (but not all) of the terms t₁, . . . , t_n. In the first two cases, does not contain an atomic formula, by the policy that the categories do not overlap. Since P is an n-place predicate letter, by the policy that the predicate letters are distinct, P is not an m-place predicate letter for any m n. So the part of that consists of P followed by the terms is not an atomic formula. In all of these cases, then, does not contain an atomic formula. By Lemma 4, is not a formula.

Theorem 6. Let be any formula of 1K=. If is not atomic, then there is one and only one among (2)-(7) that was the last clause applied to construct . That is, could not be produced by two different clauses. Moreover, no formula produced by clauses (3)-(7) is atomic.

Proof: By Clause (8), either is atomic or it was produced by one of clauses (2)-(7). Thus, the first symbol in must be either a predicate letter, a term, a unary marker, or a left parenthesis. If the first symbol in is a predicate letter or term, then is atomic. In this case, was not produced by any of (2)-(7), since all such formulas begin with something other than a predicate letter or term. If the first symbol in is a negation sign "¬", then was produced by clause (2), and not by any other clause (since the other clauses produce formulas that begin with either a quantifier or a left parenthesis). Similarly, if begins with a universal quantifier, then it was produced by clause (6), and not by any other clause, and if begins with an existential quantifier, then it was produced by clause (7), and not by any other clause. The only case left is where begins with a left parenthesis. In this case, it must have been produced by one of (3)-(5), and not by any other clause. We only need to rule out the possibility that was produced by more than one of (3)-(5). To take an example, suppose that was produced by (3) and (4). Then is (₁ & ₂) and is also (_{3 4}), where ₁, ₂, ₃, and ₄ are themselves formulas. That is, (₁ & ₂) is the very same formula as (_{3 4}). By Theorem 5, ₁ cannot be a proper part of ₃, nor can ₃ be a proper part of ₁. So ₁ must be the same formula as ₃. But then "&" must be the same symbol as "", and this contradicts the policy that all of the symbols are different. So was not produced by both Clause (3) and Clause (4). Similar reasoning takes care of the other combinations.

3. Deduction

We write an argument in the form <, >, where is the set of premises and is the conclusion. Remember that may be empty. We write to indicate that is deducible from , or, in other words, that the argument <, > is deducible in D. We may write _D to emphasize the deductive system D. We write or _D to indicate that can be deduced (in D) from the empty set of premises.

The rules in D are chosen to match logical relations concerning the English analogues of the logical terminology in the language. Again, we define the deducibility relation by recursion. We start with a rule of assumptions:

(As) If is a member of , then .

First, recall that "&" is an analogue of the English connective "and". Intuitively, one can deduce a formula in the form ( & ) if one has deduced and one has deduced . Conversely, one can deduce from ( & ) and one can deduce from ( & ):

(&I) If ₁ and ₂ , then ₁, ₂ ( & ).

(&E) If ( & ) then ; and if ( & ) then .

Since, the symbol "" corresponds to the English "or", ( ) should be deducible from , and ( ) should also be deducible from :

(I) If then ( ); if then ( ).

(E) If ₁ ( ), ₂, and ₃, , then ₁, ₂, ₃ .

(I) If , , then ( ).

(E) If ₁ ( ) and ₂ , then ₁, ₂ .

(¬I) If ₁, and ₂, ¬, then ₁, ₂ ¬.

By (As), we have that {A,¬A} A and {A,¬A} ¬A. So by ¬I we have that {A} ¬¬A. However, we do not have the converse yet. Intuitively, ¬¬ corresponds to "it is not the case that it is not the case that" . One might think that this last is equivalent to , and we have a rule to that effect:

(DNE) If ¬¬, then .

To illustrate the parts of the deductive system D presented thus far, I show that (A ¬A):

(i) {¬(A ¬A), A} ¬(A ¬A), by (As)

(ii) {¬(A ¬A), A} A, by clause (As).

(iii) {¬(A ¬A), A} (A ¬A), by (I), from (ii).

(iv) {¬(A ¬A)} ¬A, by (¬I), from (i) and (iii).

(v) {¬(A ¬A), ¬A} ¬(A ¬A), by (As)

(vi) {¬(A ¬A), ¬A} ¬A, by (As)

(vii) {¬(A ¬A), ¬A} (A ¬A), by (I), from (vi).

(viii) {¬(A ¬A)} ¬¬A, by (¬I), from (v) and (vii).

(ix) ¬¬(A ¬A), by (¬I), from (iv) and (viii).

(x) (A ¬A), by (DNE), from (ix).

Let , ¬ be a pair of contradictory opposites, and let be any formula at all. By (As) we have {, ¬, ¬} and {, ¬, ¬} ¬. So by (¬I), {, ¬} ¬¬. So, by (DNE) we have {, ¬} . That is, anything at all follows from a pair of contradictory opposites. Some logicians introduce a rule to codify a similar inference:

If ₁ and ₂ ¬, then for any formula , ₁, ₂

Some logicians object to ex falso quodlibet, on the ground that the formula may be irrelevant to any of the premises in . Suppose, for example, that one starts with some premises about human nature and facts about certain people, and then deduces both the sentence "Clinton had extra-marital sexual relations" and "Clinton did not have extra-marital sexual relations". One can surely conclude that there is something wrong with premises . But should we be allowed to then deduce anything at all from ? Should we be allowed to deduce "The economy is sound"?

Deductive systems that demur from ex falso quodlibet are part of relevance logic. See Anderson and Belnap [1975], Anderson, Belnap, and Dunn [1992], and Tennant [1987]. Deep philosophical issues concerning the nature of logical consequence are involved. Far be it for an article in a philosophy encyclopedia to avoid philosophical issues, but space considerations preclude a fuller treatment of this issue here. Suffice it to note that the inference is sanctioned in systems of classical logic, the subject of this article. It is essential to establishing the balance between the deductive system and the semantics (see §5 below).

The next pieces of D are the clauses for the quantifiers. Let be a formula, v a variable, and t a term (i.e., a variable or a constant). The define (v|t) to be the result of substituting t for each free occurrence of v in . So, if is (Qx & xPxy), then (x|c) is (Qc & xPxy). The last occurrence of x is not free (but recall that we avoid using formulas like this).

We have one other nicety to attend to. Suppose that v₁ and v₂ are variables. It may happen that some of the substituted instances of v₂ are bound in (v₁|v₂). When this happens, we say that there is a clash of the variables. Suppose, for example, that is y(¬x = y), and so (x|y) is y(¬y = y). We say that a term t is free for a variable v in if either t is a constant or there is no clash of variables in (v|t). The idea is that no substituted instance of t should become a bound variable in (v|t).

A formula in the form v is an analogue of the English "for every v, holds". So one should be able to infer (v|t) from v :

(E) If v , then (v|t), provided that t is free for v in .

The introduction clause for the universal quantifier is a bit more complicated. Suppose that a formula has a variable v free, and that has been deduced from a set of premises . If the variable v does not occur free in any member of , then will hold no matter which object v may denote. That is, v follows.

(I) If and the variable v does not occur free in any member of , then v.

The existential quantifier is an analogue of the English expression "there exists", or perhaps just "there is". If we have established (or assumed) that a given object t has a given property, then it follows that there is something that has that property. Again, we have to be careful with the syntax, and avoid clashes of variables.

(I) If , then v , where is obtained from by substituting the variable v for zero or more occurrences of a term t, provided that (1) if t is a variable, then all of the replaced occurrences of t are free in , and (2) all of the substituted occurrences of v are free in .

The elimination rule for is not quite as simple:

(E) If ₁ v and ₂, , then ₁, ₂ , provided that v does not occur free in , nor in any member of ₂.

As noted in the previous section, some authors introduce different letters for bound variables and (what amounts to) free variables. This makes the syntax slightly more complex, but simplifies the provisions on some of the rules of inference. Writers of logic books often face tradeoffs like this.

The final items are the rules for the identity sign "=". The introduction rule is about a simple as can be:

(=I) t=t, where t is any term.

(=E) If ₁ t₁=t₂ and ₂ , then ₁, ₂ , where is obtained from by replacing zero or more occurrences of t₁ with t₂, provided that no bound variables are replaced, and if t₂ is a variable, then all of its substituted occurrences are free.

One final clause completes the description of the deductive system D:

(*) That's all folks. only if follows from members of by the above rules.

Before moving on to the model theory for 1K=, we pause to note a few features of the deductive system.

Lemma 7. Suppose that _D , and let v be a variable that does not occur free in or in any member of . Assume that v is free for v in and in every member of . Let be {(v|v) | }. That is, is the result of replacing every free occurrence of a variable v with v in every member of . Then _D (v|v).

Proof: The proof of this lemma is tedious, but we give its essentials. We proceed by induction on the number of rules that were used to arrive at . Suppose that n>0 is a natural number, and that the lemma holds for any argument that was derived using fewer than n rules, and suppose that using exactly n rules. If n=1, then the rule applied is either (As) or (=I). In this case, (v|v) by the same rule. If the last rule applied is (&I), then has the form ( & ), and we have ₁ and ₂ , with = ₁, ₂. We apply the induction hypothesis to the deductions of and , and then apply (&I) to the result. If the last rule applied was (&E), we have two sub-cases, but they are symmetric. We have ( & ). There are two slight complications here: the new variable v may occur free in and it may not be free for v in . In either case, first pick a new variable u that does not occur (free or bound) in ( & ) or in any member of . Now apply the induction hypothesis, substituting u for v in the deduction ( & ). Since v does not occur free in or in any member of , those formulas are left unchanged. The maneuver removes any free occurrences of v from the subformula . Now apply the induction hypothesis to the result, substituting v for v, and then apply (&E). The remaining cases are similar.

Theorem 8. The rule of Weakening. If ₁ and _{1 2}, then ₂ .

Proof: Again, we proceed by induction on the number of rules that were used to arrive at ₁. Suppose that n>0 is a natural number, and that the theorem holds for any argument that was derived using fewer than n rules. Suppose that ₁ using exactly n rules. If n=1, then the rule is either (As) or (=I). In these cases, ₂ by the same rule. If the last rule applied was (&I), then has the form (&), and we have ₃ and ₄, with ₁ = ₃, ₄. We apply the induction hypothesis to the deductions of and , to get ₂ and ₂. and then apply (&I) to the result to get ₂. Most of the other cases are exactly like this. Slight complications arise only in the rules (I) and (E), because there we have to pay attention to the conditions for the rules. Starting with (E), we have ₃v and ₄, , with ₁ being ₃, ₄, and v not free in , nor in any member of ₄. We apply the induction hypothesis to get ₂v, and then (E) to end up with ₂. Suppose that the last rule applied to get ₁ is (I). So is a formula in the form v, and we have ₁ and the variable v does not occur free in any member of ₁. The problem is that v may occur free in a member of ₂, and so we cannot just invoke the induction hypothesis and apply (I) to the result. Let v be a variable that does not occur (free or bound) in or in any member of ₂, and let be the result of substituting v for every free occurrence of v in ₂. Since v does not occur free in any member of ₁, we still have ₁. The induction hypothesis gives us , and now we apply (I) to get . We now apply Lemma 7, substituting v for the new variable v. The result is ₂.

Theorem 9. if and only if there is a finite such that .

Theorem 10. The rule of ex falso quodlibet is a "derived rule" of D. That is, if ₁ and ₂ ¬, then ₁,₂, for any formula .

Proof: Suppose that ₁ and ₂¬. Then by Theorem 8, ₁,¬ , and ₂,¬ . So by (¬I), ₁, ₂ ¬¬. By (DNE), ₁, ₂.

Theorem 11. The rule of Cut. If ₁ and ₂, , then ₁, ₂.

Proof: Suppose ₁ and ₂, . We proceed by induction on the number of rules used to establish ₂, . Suppose that n is a natural number, and that the theorem holds for any argument that was derived using fewer than n rules. Suppose that ₂, was derived using exactly n rules. If the last rule used was (=I), then ₁, ₂ is also an instance of (=I). If ₂, is an instance of (As), then either is , or is a member of ₂. In the former case, we have ₁ by supposition, and get ₁, ₂ by Weakening (Theorem 8). In the latter case, ₁, ₂ is itself an instance of (As). Suppose that ₂, was obtained using (&E). Then we have ₂, (&). The induction hypothesis gives us ₁, ₂ (&), and (&E) produces ₁, ₂. The remaining cases are similar.

If _D, then we say that the formula is a deductive consequence of the set of formulas , and that the argument <,> is deductively valid. A formula is a logical theorem, or a deductive logical truth, if _D. That is, is a logical theorem if it is a deductive consequence of the empty set. A set of formulas is consistent if there is no formula such that _D and _D ¬. That is, a set is consistent if it does not entail a pair of contradictory opposite formulas.

Theorem 12. A set is consistent if and only if there is a formula such that it is not the case that .

Proof: Suppose that is consistent and let be any formula. Then either it is not the case that or it is not the case that ¬. For the converse, suppose that is inconsistent and let be any formula. We have that there is a formula such that both and ¬. By ex falso quodlibet (Theorem 10), .

Theorem 13. The Lindenbaum Lemma. Let be any consistent set of formulas of 1K=. Then there is a set of formulas of 1K= such that and is maximally consistent.

Proof: Although this theorem holds in general, we assume here that the set K of non-logical terminology is either finite or denumerably infinite (i.e., the size of the natural numbers, usually called ₀). It follows that there is an enumeration ₀, ₁, . . . of the formulas of 1K=, such that every formula of 1K= eventually occurs in the list. Define a sequence of sets of formulas, by recursion, as follows: ₀ is ; for each natural number n, if _n, _n is consistent, then let _n+1 = _n, _n. Otherwise, let _n+1 = _n. Let be the union of all of the sets _n. Intuitively, the idea is to go through the formulas of 1K=, throwing each one into if doing so produces a consistent set. Notice that each _n is consistent. Suppose that is inconsistent. Then there is a formula such that and ¬. By Theorem 9 and Weakening (Theorem 8), there is finite subset of such that and ¬. Because is finite, there is a natural number n such that every member of is in _n. So, by Weakening again, _n and _n¬. So _n is inconsistent, which contradicts the construction. So is consistent. Now suppose that a formula is not in . We have to show that , is inconsistent. The formula must occur in the aforementioned list of formulas; say that is _m. Since _m is not in , then it is not in _m+1. This happens only if _m, _m is inconsistent. So a pair of contradictory opposites can be deduced from _m,_m. By Weakening, a pair of contradictory opposites can be deduced from , _m. So , _m is inconsistent. Thus, is maximally consistent.

4. Semantics

If c is a constant in K, then I(c) is a member of the domain d.

If P⁰ is a zero-place predicate letter in K, then I(P⁰) is a truth value, either truth or falsehood.

If Q¹ is a one-place predicate letter in K, then I(Q) is a subset of d. Intuitively, I(Q) is the set of members of the domain that the predicate Q holds of. If Q represents "red", then I(Q) might be the red members of the domain.

If R² is a two-place predicate letter in K, then I(R) is a set of ordered pairs of members of d. Intuitively, I(R) is the set of pairs of members of the domain that the relation R holds between. If R represents "love", then I(R) might consist of the pairs <a,b>, such that a loves b.

In general, if Sⁿ is an n-place predicate letter in K, then I(S) is a set of ordered n-tuples of members of d.

We now define a relation of satisfaction between interpretations, variable-assignments, and formulas of 1K=. If is a formula of 1K=, M is an interpretation for 1K=, and s is a variable-assignment on M, then we write M,s for M satisfies under the assignment s. The idea is that M,s is an analogue of " comes out true when interpreted as in M via s".

Let t be a term of 1K=. We define the denotation of t in M under s, in terms of the interpretation function and variable-assignment:

If c is a constant, then D_M,s(c) is I(c), and if v is a variable, then D_M,s(v) is s(v).

That is, the interpretation M assigns denotations to the constants, while the variable-assignment assigns denotations to the (free) variables. If the language contained function symbols, the denotation function would be defined by recursion.

We now proceed by recursion on the complexity of the formulas of 1K=.

If t₁ and t₂ are terms, then M,s t₁=t₂ if and only if D_M,s(t₁) is the same as D_M,s(t₂).

If P⁰ is a zero-place predicate letter in K, then M,sP if and only if I(P) is truth.

If Sⁿ is an n-place predicate letter in K and t₁, . . . , t_n are terms, then M,s St₁ . . . t_n if and only if the n-tuple <D_M,s(t₁), . . . , D_M,s(t_n)> is in I(S).

This takes care of the atomic formulas. We now proceed to the compound formulas of the language, following the meanings of the English counterparts of the logical terminology.

M,s ¬ if and only if it is not the case that M,s.

M,s (&) if and only if both M,s and M,s.

M,s () if and only if either M,s or M,s.

M,s () if and only if either it is not the case that M,s, or M,s.

M,s v if and only if M,s, for every assignment s that agrees with s except possibly at the variable v.

M,s v if and only if M,s, for some assignment s that agrees with s except possibly at the variable v.

Theorem 6, unique readability, assures us that this definition is coherent. At each stage in breaking down a formula, there is exactly one clause to be applied, and so we never get contradictory verdicts concerning satisfaction.

As indicated, the role of variable-assignments is to give denotations to the free variables. We now show that variable-assignments play no other role.

Theorem 14. For any formula , if s₁ and s₂ agree on the free variables in , then M,s₁ if and only if M,s₂.

Proof: We proceed by induction on the complexity of the formula . The theorem clearly holds if is atomic, since in those cases only the values of the variable-assignments at the variables in figure in the definition. Assume, then, that the theorem holds for all formulas less complex than . And suppose that s₁ and s₂ agree on the free variables of . Assume, first, that is a negation, ¬. Then, by the induction hypothesis, M,s₁ if and only if M,s₂. So, by the clause for negation, M,s₁ ¬ if and only if M,s₂ ¬. The cases where the main connective in is a binary connectives are also straightforward. Suppose that is v, and that M,s₁ v. Then there is an assignment s₁ that agrees with s₁ except possibly at v such that M,s₁. Let s₂ be the assignment that agrees with s₂ on the free variables not in and agrees with s₁ on the others. Then, by the induction hypothesis, M,s₂. Notice that s₂ agrees with s₂ on every variable except possibly v. So M,s₂ v. The converse is the same, and the case where begins with a universal quantifier is similar.

Suppose that KK are two sets of non-logical terms. If M = <d,I> is an interpretation of 1K=, then we define the restriction of M to 1K be the interpretation M=<d,I> such that I is the restriction of I to K. That is, M and M have the same domain and agree on the non-logical terminology in K. A straightforward induction establishes the following:

Theorem 15. If M is the restriction of M to 1K, then for every formula of 1K, if s is any variable-assignment, M,s if and only if M,s.

Theorem 16. If two interpretations M₁, M₂ have the same domain and agree on the non-logical terminology of a formula , then if s is any variable-assignment, M₁,s if and only if M₂,s.

We say that an argument <,> is semantically valid, or just valid, written , if for every interpretation M of the language and any variable-assignment s on M, if M,s, for every member of , then M,s. If , we also say that is a logical consequence, or semantic consequence, or model-theoretic consequence of . The definition corresponds to the informal idea that an argument is valid if it is not possible for its premises to all be true and its conclusion false. Our definition of logical consequence also sanctions the common thesis that a valid argument is truth-preserving--to the extent that satisfaction represents truth. Officially, an argument in 1K= is valid if its conclusion comes out true under every interpretation of the language in which the premises are true. Validity is the model-theoretic counterpart to deducibility.

A formula is logically true, or valid, if M,s, for every interpretation M and assignment s. A formula is logically true if and only if it is a consequence of the empty set. If is logically true, then for any set of formulas, . Logical truth is the model-theoretic counterpart of theoremhood.

A formula is satisfiable if there is an interpretation M and a variable-assignment s on M such that M,s . That is, is satisfiable if there is an interpretation and assignment that satisfies it. A set of formulas is satisfiable if there is an interpretation M and a variable-assignment s on M such that M,s , for every formula in . If is a set of sentences and if M for each sentence in , then we say that M is a model of . So a set of sentences is satisfiable if it has a model. Satisfiability is the model-theoretic counterpart to consistency.

Notice that if and only if the set ,¬ is not satisfiable. It follows that if a set is not satisfiable, then if is any formula, . This is a model-theoretic counterpart to ex falso quodlibet (see Theorem 10). We have the following, as an analogue to Theorem 12:

Theorem 17. Let be a set of formulas. The following are equivalent: (a) is satisfiable; (b) there is no formula such that both and ¬; (c) there is some formula such that it is not the case that .

Proof: (a)(b): Suppose that is satisfiable and let be any formula. There is an interpretation M and assignment s such that M,s for every member of . By the clause for negations, we cannot have both M,s and M,s ¬. So either <,> is not valid or else <,¬> is not valid. (b)(c): This is immediate. (c)(a): Suppose that it is not the case that . Then there is an interpretation M and an assignment s such that M,s, for every formula in and it is not the case that M,s. A fortiori, M,s satisfies every member of , and so is satisfiable.

5. Meta-theory

Theorem 18. Soundness. For any formula and set of formulas, if _D, then .

Proof: We proceed by induction on the number of clauses used to establish . So let n be a natural number, and assume that the theorem holds for any argument established as deductively valid with fewer than n steps. And suppose that was established using exactly n steps. If the last rule applied was (=I) then is a formula in the form t=t, and so is logically true. A fortiori, . If the last rule applied was (As), then is a member of , and so of course any interpretation and assignment that satisfies every member of also satisfies . Suppose the last rule applied is (&I). So has the form (&), and we have ₁ and ₂, with = ₁, ₂. The induction hypothesis gives us ₁ and ₂. Suppose that M,s satisfies every member of . Then M,s satisfies every member of ₁, and so M,s satisfies . Similarly, M,s satisfies every member of ₂, and so M,s satisfies . Thus, by the clause for "&" in the definition of satisfaction, M,s satisfies . So . Suppose the last clause applied was (E). So we have ₁ v and ₂, , where = ₁, ₂, and v does not occur free in , nor in any member of ₂. By the induction hypothesis, we have ₁ v and ₂, . Let M be an interpretation and s an assignment such that M,s satisfies every member of . Then M,s satisfies every member of ₁, and so M,sv. So there is an assignment s that agrees with s on every variable except possibly v such that M,s. We have that M,s satisfies every member of ₂. Since v does not occur free in any member of ₂, and s agrees with s on everything else, we have that M,s satisfies every member of ₂, by Theorem 14. So M,s . Since v does not occur free in , and s agrees with s on everything else, we have that M,s , also by Theorem 14. So, in this case, . Notice the role of the restrictions on (E) here. The other cases are about as straightforward.

Corollary 19. Let be a set of formulas. If is satisfiable, then is consistent.

Proof: Suppose that is satisfiable. So let M be an interpretation and s an assignment such that M,s satisfies every member of . Assume that is inconsistent. Then there is a formula such that and ¬. By soundness (Theorem 18), and ¬. So we have that M,s and M,s ¬. But this is impossible, given the clause for negation in the definition of satisfaction.

Theorem 20. Completeness. Gödel [1930]. Let be a set of formulas. If is consistent, then is satisfiable.

Proof: The proof of completeness is rather complex. We only sketch it here. Let be a consistent set of formulas of 1K=. Again, we assume for simplicity that the set K of non-logical terminology is either finite or countably infinite (although the theorem holds even if K is uncountable). The task at hand is to find an interpretation M and a variable-assignment s on M, such that M,s satisfies every member of . Consider the language obtained from 1K= by adding a denumerably infinite stock of new individual constants c₀, c₁, . . . We stipulate that the constants, c₀, c₁, . . . , are all different from each other and none of them occur in K. We build an interpretation of the language from the language itself, using some of the constants as members of the domain of discourse. Let ₀, ₁, . . . be an enumeration of the formulas of the expanded language, so that each formula occurs in the list eventually. Let x be any variable, and define a sequence ₀, ₁, . . . of sets of formulas (of the expanded language) by recursion as follows: ₀ = ; and _n+1 = _n,(x_{n n}(x|c_i)), where c_i is the first constant in the above list that does not occur in _n or in any member of _n. The underlying idea here is that if x_nis true, then c_i is to be one such x. Let be the union of the sets _n.

I sketch a proof that is consistent. Suppose that is inconsistent. By Theorem 9, there is a finite subset of that is inconsistent, and so one of the sets _m is inconsistent. By hypothesis, ₀ = is consistent. Let n be the smallest number such that _n is consistent, but _n+1 = _n,(x_{n n}(x|c_i)) is inconsistent. By (¬I), we have that

(1) _n ¬(x_{n n}(x|c_i)).

By ex falso quodlibet (Theorem 10), _n, ¬x_n, x_{n n}(x|c_i). So by (I), _n, ¬x_n (x_{n n}(x|c_i)). From this and (1), we have _n ¬¬x_n, by (¬I), and by (DNE) we have

(2) _n x_n.

By (As), _n, _n(x|c_i), x_{n n}(x|c_i). So by (I), _n, _n(x|c_i) (x_{n n}(x|c_i)). From this and (1), we have _n ¬_n(x|c_i), by (¬I). Let v be a variable that does not occur (free or bound) in _n or in any member of _n. By uniform substitution of v for c_i, we can turn the derivation of _n¬_n(x|c_i) into _n¬_n(x|v). By (I), we have

(3) _n v¬_n(x|v).

By (As) we have {v¬_n(x|v),_n} _n and by (E) we have {v¬_n(x|v), _n} ¬_n. So {v¬_n(x|v), _n} is inconsistent. Let be any sentence of the language (so that has no free variables). By ex falso quodlibet (Theorem 10), we have that {v¬_n(x|v),_n} and {v¬_n(x|v), _n} ¬. So with (2), we have that _n, v¬_n(x|v) and _n, v¬_n(x|v) ¬, by (E). By Cut (Theorem 11), _n and _n ¬. So _n is inconsistent, contradicting the assumption. So is consistent.

Applying the Lindenbaum Lemma (Theorem 13), let be a maximally consistent set of sentences (of the expanded language) that contains . So, of course, contains . We define an interpretation M, and a variable-assignment s on M, such that M,s satisfies every member of .

If we did not have a sign for identity in the language, we would let the domain of M be the collection of new constants {c₀, c₁, . . . }. But as it is, there may be a sentence in the form c_i=c_j, with ij, in . If so, we cannot have both c_i and c_j in the domain of the interpretation. So we define the domain d of M to be the set {c_i | there is no j<i such that c_i=c_j is in }. In other words, a constant c_i is in the domain of M if does not declare it to be identical to an earlier constant in the list. Notice that for each new constant c_i, there is exactly one ji such that c_j is in d and the sentence c_i=c_j is in .

We now define the interpretation function I. Let a be any constant in the expanded language. By (=I) and (I), x x=a, and so x x=a . By the construction of , there is a sentence in the form (x x=a c_i=a) in . We have that c_i=a is in . As above, there is exactly one c_j in d such that c_i=c_j is in . Let I(a)=c_j. Notice that if c_i is a constant in the domain d, then I(c_i)=c_i. That is each c_i in d denotes itself.

Let P be a one-place predicate letter in K. Let I(P) be the set of constants {c_i | c_i is in d and the formula Pc is in }. Let R be a binary predicate letter in K. Let I(R) be the set of pairs of constants {<c_i,c_j> | c_i is in d, c_j is in d, and the formula Rc_ic_j is in }. Three-place predicates, etc. are interpreted similarly. In effect, I interprets the non-logical terminology as they are in .

The variable-assignment is similar. If v is a variable, then s(v)=c_i, where c_i is the first constant in d such that c_i=v is in .

The final item in this proof is a tedious lemma that for every formula in the expanded language, M,s if and only if is in . This proceeds by induction on the complexity of . The case where is atomic follows from the definitions of M (i.e., the domain d and the interpretation function I) and the variable-assignment s. The other cases follow from the various clauses in the definition of satisfaction.

Since , we have that M,s satisfies every member of . By Theorem 15, the restriction of M to the original language 1K= and s also satisfies every member of . Thus is satisfiable.

Theorem 21. For any formula and set of formulas, if , then _D.

Proof: Suppose that . Then there is no interpretation M and assignment s such that M,s satisfies every member of but does not satisfy . So the set ,¬ is not satisfiable. By Completeness (Theorem 20), ,¬ is inconsistent. So there is a formula such that ,¬ and ,¬ ¬. By (¬I), ¬¬, and by (DNE) .

Our next item is a corollary of Theorem 9, Soundness (Theorem 18), and Completeness:

Corollary 22. Compactness. A set of formulas is satisfiable if and only if every finite subset of is satisfiable.

Proof: If M,s satisfies every member of , then M,s satisfies every member of each finite subset of . For the converse, suppose that is not satisfiable. Then we show that some finite subset of is not satisfiable. By Completeness (Theorem 20), is inconsistent. By Theorem 9 (and Weakening), there is a finite subset such that is inconsistent. By Corollary 19, is not satisfiable.

Recall that in the proof of Completeness (Theorem 20), we made the simplifying assumption that the set K of non-logical constants is either finite or denumerably infinite. The interpretation we produced was itself either finite or denumerably infinite. Thus, we have the following:

Corollary 23. Löwenheim-Skolem Theorem. Let be a satisfiable set of sentences of the language 1K=. If is either finite or denumerably infinite, then has a model whose domain is either finite or denumerably infinite.

There is a stronger version of Corollary 23. Let M₁=<d₁,I₁> and M₂=<d₂,I₂> be interpretations of the language 1K=. Define M₁ to be a submodel of M₂ if d₁ d₂, I₁(c) = I₂(c) for each constant c, and I₁ is the restriction of I₂ to d₁. For example, if R is a binary relation letter in K, then for all a,b in d₁, the pair <a,b> is in I₁(R) if and only if <a,b> is in I₂(R). If we had included function letters among the non-logical terminology, we would also require that d₁ be closed under their interpretations in M₂. Notice that if M₁ is a submodel of M₂, then any variable-assignment on M₁ is also a variable-assignment on M₂.

Say that two interpretations M₁=<d₁,I₁>, M₂=<d₂,I₂> are elementarily equivalent if one of them is a submodel of the other, and for any formula of the language and any variable-assignment s on the submodel, M₁,s if and only if M₂,s. Notice that if two interpretations are elementarily equivalent, then they satisfy the same sentences.

Theorem 25. Downward Löwenheim-Skolem Theorem. Let M = <d,I> be an interpretation of the language 1K=. Let d₁ be any subset of d, and let be the maximum of the size of K, the size of d₁, and denumerably infinite. Then there is a submodel M = <d,I> of M such that (1) d is not larger than , and (2) M and M are elementarily equivalent. In particular, if the set K of non-logical terminology is either finite or denumerably infinite, then any interpretation has an elementarily equivalent submodel whose domain is either finite or denumerably infinite.

Proof: Like completeness, this proof is complex, and we rest content with a sketch. The downward Löwenheim-Skolem theorem invokes the axiom of choice, and indeed, is equivalent to the axiom of choice. So let C be a choice function on the powerset of d, so that for each non-empty subset ed, C(e) is a member of e. We stipulate that if e is the empty set, then C(e) is C(d).

Let s be a variable-assignment on M, let be a formula of 1K=, and let v be a variable. Define the v-witness of over s, written w_v(,s), as follows: Let q be the set of all elements cd such that there is a variable-assignment s on M that agrees with s on every variable except possibly v, such that M,s, and s(v)=c. Then w_v(,s) = C(q). Notice that if M,sv, then q is the set of elements of the domain that can go for v in . Indeed, M,sv if and only if q is non-empty. So if M,sv, then w_v(,s) (i.e., C(q)) is a chosen element of the domain that can go for v in . In a sense, it is a "witness" that verifies M,sv.

If e is a non-empty subset of the domain d, then define a variable-assignment s to be an e-assignment if for all variables u, s(u) is in e. That is, s is an e-assignment if s assigns an element of e to each variable. Define sk(e), the Skolem-hull of e, to be the set:

e {w_v(,s) | is a formula in 1K=, v is a variable, and s is an e-assignment}.

That is, the Skolem-Hull of e is the set e together with every v-witness of every formula over every e-assignment. Roughly, the idea is to start with e and then throw in enough elements to make each existentially quantified formula true. But we cannot rest content with the Skolem-hull, however. Once we throw the "witnesses" into the domain, we need to deal with sk(e) assignments. In effect, we need a set which is its own Skolem-hull, and also contains the given subset d₁.

We define a sequence of non-empty sets e₀, e₁, . . . as follows: if the given subset d₁ of d is empty and there are no constants in K, then let e₀ be C(d), the choice function applied to the entire domain; otherwise let e₀ be the union of d₁ and the denotations under I of the constants in K. For each natural number n, e_n+1 is sk(e_n). Finally, let d be the union of the sets e_n, and let I be the restriction of I to d. Our interpretation is M = <d,I>.

Clearly, d₁ is a subset of d, and so M is a submodel of M. Let be the maximum of the size of K, the size of d₁, and denumerably infinite. A calculation reveals that the size of d is at most , based on the fact that there are at most -many formulas, and thus, at most -many witnesses at each stage. Notice, incidentally, that this calculation relies on the fact that a denumerable union of sets of size at most is itself at most . This also relies on the axiom of choice.

The final item is to show that M is elementarily equivalent to M: For every formula and every variable-assignment s on M,

M,s if and only if M,s.

We proceed by induction on the complexity of . If is atomic, then the definition of satisfaction entails the equivalence. So let be non-atomic, and assume that M,s if and only if M,s, for all assignments s on M and all formulas less complex than . Let s be any such assignment. If the main connective of is the negation sign or a binary connective, then the induction hypothesis entails that M,s if and only if M,s. The remaining cases are those in which begins with a quantifier, i.e., is either v or v. Suppose that M,sv. Then there is a variable-assignment s that agrees with s except possibly at v such that M,s. By the induction hypothesis, M,s and so M,sv. The converse is a bit tricky, and amounts to showing that the Skolem-hull of d is d. Assume that M,s v. We are given that s is a variable-assignment on d. Since there are only finitely many free-variables in , let n be any natural number such that for all variables u that occur free in , s(u) is in e_n. Let s₁ be an e_n-assignment that agrees with s on all of the free variables in . Then, by Theorem 14, M,s₁v. Let c be w_v(,s₁), the v-witness of over s₁. Notice that c is in e_n+1 and so c is in d. Let s₁ agree with s₁, except possibly at v, and let s₁(v)=c. So s₁ is a variable-assignment on M. By the definition of the witness function, M,s₁. By the induction hypothesis, M,s₁, and so M,s₁v. By Theorem 14, M,sv. The final case, where has the form v, is similar.

Another corollary to Compactness (Corollary 22) is the opposite of the Löwenheim-Skolem theorem:

Theorem 26. Upward Löwenheim-Skolem Theorem. Let be any set of formulas of 1K=, such that for each natural number n, there is an interpretation M_n = <d_n,I_n>, and an assignment s_n on M_n, such that d_n has at least n elements, and M_n,s_n satisfies every member of . In other words, is satisfiable and there is no finite upper bound to the size of the interpretations that satisfy every member of . Then for any infinite cardinal , there is an interpretation M=<d,I> and assignment s on M, such that the size of d is at least and M,s satisfies every member of . In particular, if is a set of sentences, then it has arbitrarily large models.

Proof: Add a collection of new constants {c | <}, of size , to the language, so that if c is a constant in K, then c is different from c, and if <<, then c is a different constant than c. Consider the set of formulas consisting of together with the set {¬c=c | }. That is, consists of together with statements to the effect that any two different new constants denote different objects. Let be any finite subset of , and let m be the number of new constants that occur in . Then expand the interpretation M_m to an interpretation M_m of the new language, by interpreting each of the new constants in as a different member of the domain d_m. By hypothesis, there are enough members of d_m to do this. One can interpret the other new constants at will. So M_m is a restriction of M_m. By hypothesis (and Theorem 15), M_m,s_m satisfies every member of . Also M_m,s_m satisfies the members of {¬c=c | } that are in . So M_m,s_m satisfies every member of . By compactness, there is an interpretation M = <d,I> and an assignment s on M such that M,s satisfies every member of . Since contains every member of {¬c=c | }, the domain d of M must be of size at least , since each of the new constants must have a different denotation. By Theorem 15, the restriction of M to the original language 1K= satisfies every member of , with the variable-assignment s.

The proofs of the downward and upward Löwenheim-Skolem theorems can be combined to show that for any satisfiable set of sentences, if there is no finite bound on the models of , then for any infinite cardinal , there is a model of whose domain has size exactly . Moreover, if M is any interpretation whose domain is infinite, then for any infinite cardinal , there is an interpretation M whose domain has size exactly such that M and M are elementarily equivalent.

These results indicate a weakness in the expressive resources of first-order languages like 1K=. No satisfiable set of sentences can guarantee that its models are all denumerably infinite, nor can any satisfiable set of sentences guarantee that its models are uncountable. So in a sense, first-order languages cannot express the notion of "denumerably infinite", at least not in the model theory.

Let A be any set of sentences in a first-order language 1K=, where K includes terminology for arithmetic, and assume that every member of A is true of the natural numbers. We can even let A be the set of all sentences in 1K= that are true of the natural numbers. Then A has uncountable models, indeed models of any infinite cardinality. Such interpretations are sometimes called unintended, or non-standard models of arithmetic. Let B be any set of first-order sentences that are true of the real numbers, and let C be any first-order axiomatization of set theory. Then if B and C are satisfiable (in infinite interpretations), then each of them has denumerably infinite models. That is, any first-order, satisfiable set theory or theory of the real numbers, has (unintended) models the size of the natural numbers. This is despite the fact that a sentence (seemingly) stating that the universe is uncountable is provable in most set-theories. This situation, known as the Skolem paradox, has generated much discussion, but we must refer the reader elsewhere for a sample of it.

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• Davidson, D. [1984], Inquiries into truth and interpretation, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
• Dummett, M. [1977], Elements of intuitionism, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Gödel, K. [1930], "Die Vollständigkeit der Axiome des logischen Funktionenkalkuls", Montatshefte für Mathematik und Physik 37, 349-360; translated as "The completeness of the axioms of the functional calculus of logic", in van Heijenoort [1967], 582-591.
• Lycan, W. [1984], Logical form in natural language, Cambridge, Massachusetts: The MIT Press.
• Montague, R. [1974], Formal philosophy, ed. by R. Thomason, New Haven: Yale University Press.
• Quine, W. V. O. [1960], Word and object, Cambridge, Massachusetts: The MIT Press.
• Quine, W. V. O. [1986], Philosophy of logic, second edition, Englewood Cliffs, New Jersey: Prentice-Hall.
• Shapiro, S. [1998], "Logical consequence: models and modality", in The philosophy of mathematics today, edited by M. Schirn, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 131-156.
• Tennant, N. [1987], "Conventional necessity and the contingency of deduction", Dialectica 41, 79-95.

Further Reading

• Boolos, G., and R. Jeffrey [1989], Computability and logic, third edition, Cambridge, England: Cambridge University Press. Textbook on mathematical logic.
• Enderton, H. [1972], A mathematical introduction to logic, New York: Academic Press. Textbook in mathematical logic.
• Forbes, G. [1994], Modern Logic, Oxford: Oxford University Press. Elementary textbook.
• Mendelson, E. [1987], Introduction to mathematical logic, third edition, Princeton: van Nostrand. Textbook in mathematical logic.
• Shapiro, S. [1996], The limits of logic: Second-order logic and the Skolem paradox, The international research library of philosophy, Dartmouth Publishing Company, 1996. An anthology containing many of the significant later papers on the Skolem paradox.
• Van Heijenoort, J [1967], From Frege to Gödel, Cambridge, Massachusetts: Harvard University Press. An anthology containing many of the major historical papers on mathematical logic in the early decades of the twentieth century.

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First published: September 15, 2000
Content last modified: September 15, 2000