Pick an arbitrary world
,
and let
| This is a file in the archives of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy. |
()
iff
is reachable from
.
Proof.
Pick an arbitrary world ,
and let
(
n = 1
i 1, i 2, . . . , i nN
i n ( . . . (
that is, ( )
is the set of all worlds that are reachable from . Clearly, for each i N, i( ) 
( ),
which shows that is a coarsening of the partitions i, i N.
Hence ( ) ( ),
as is the finest common coarsening of the i's.
We need to show that ( ) ( )
to complete the proof. To do this, it suffices to show that for any sequence i 1, i 2, . . . , i n N
( 1 )
We will prove ( 1 ) by induction on n. By definition, i( ) ( )
for each i N, proving ( 1 ) for n = 1. Suppose now that ( 1 ) obtains for n = k, and for a given i N, let * i( A )
where A = i k ( . . . ( i 2 ( i 1 ( ) ) ).
By induction hypothesis, A ( ).
Since i( A )
states that i 1 thinks that i 2 thinks that . . . i k thinks that i thinks that * is possible, A and i( *)
must overlap, that is, i( * ) 
A 
.
If * 
( ),
then i( * ) 
( ),
which implies that is not a common coarsening of the i's, a contradiction. Hence * ( ),
and since i was chosen arbitrarily from N, this shows that ( 1 ) obtains for n = k + 1. 
| Peter Vanderschraaf peterv@cyrus.andrew.cmu.edu |