This is a file in the archives of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.

Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Supplement to Common Knowledge
Citation Information


Proof of Proposition 2.13

Proposition 2.13 (Aumann 1976)
Let calligraphic-M be the meet of the agents' partitions calligraphic-Hi for each i in N. A proposition E subset Omega is common knowledge for the agents of N at omega iff calligraphic-M(omega) subset E. In Aumann (1976), E is defined to be common knowledge at omega iff calligraphic-M(omega) subset E.

Proof.
(left arrow) By Lemma 2.12, calligraphic-M( omega ) is common knowledge at omega, so E is common knowledge at omega by Proposition 2.4.

(right arrow) We must show that K *N ( E ) implies that calligraphic-M( omega ) subset E. Suppose that there exists omegaprime in calligraphic-M( omega ) such that omegaprime not in E. Since omegaprime in calligraphic-M( omega ), omegaprime is reachable from omega, so there exists a sequence 0, 1, . . . , m - 1 with associated states omega1, omega2, . . . , omegam and information sets calligraphic-Hi k( omegak ) such that omega0 = omega, omegam = omegaprime, and omegak in calligraphic-Hi k(omega k + 1). But at information set calligraphic-Hi k( omegam ), agent i k does not know event E. Working backwards on k, we see that event E cannot be common knowledge, that is, agent i 1 cannot rule out the possibility that agent i 2 thinks that . . . that agent i m - 1 thinks that agent i m does not know E. QED

Return to Common Knowledge

Copyright © 2002
Peter Vanderschraaf
peterv@cyrus.andrew.cmu.edu

Supplement to Common Knowledge
Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy