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Proof of Proposition 2.5

Proposition 2.5.
omega in KmN(A) iff
(1) For all agents i1, i2, … , im in N, omega in Ki1Ki2Kim(A)
Hence, omega in K*N(A) iff (1) is the case for each m greater than or equal to 1.

Proof.
Note first that

( 2 ) intersection
i 1 in N
K i 1 ( intersection
i 2 in N
K i 2 ( . . . ( intersection
i m - 1 in N
K i m - 1 ( intersection
i m in N
K i m( A ) ) ) ) )

= intersection
i 1 in N
K i 1 ( intersection
i 2 in N
K i 2 ( . . . ( intersection
i m - 1 in N
K i m - 1 (K 1N ( A ) ) ) ) )

= intersection
i 1 in N
K i 1 ( intersection
i 2 in N
K i 2 . . . ( intersection
i m - 2 in N
K i m - 2 ( K 2N ( A ) ) ) )

= . . .

= intersection
i 1 in N
K i 1( K m - 1N ( A ) )

= K mN ( A )

By ( 2 ), K mN ( A ) subset K i 1K i 2 . . . K i m( A ) for i 1, i 2, . . ., i m in N so if omega in K mN ( A ) then condition ( 1 ) is satisfied. Condition ( 1 ) is equivalent to

omega in intersection
i 1 in N
K i 1 ( intersection
i 2 in N
K i 2 ( . . . ( intersection
i m - 1 in N
K i m - 1 ( intersection
i m in N
K i m ( A ) ) ) ) )

so by ( 2 ), if ( 1 ) is satisfied then omega in K mN ( A ). QED

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Copyright © 2002
Peter Vanderschraaf
peterv@cyrus.andrew.cmu.edu

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