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Proof of Proposition 2.8

Proposition 2.8.
L*N(E) subset K*N (E), that is, Lewis-common knowledge of E implies common knowledge of E.

Proof.
Suppose that omega in L*N ( E ). By definition, there is a basis proposition A* such that omega in A*. It suffices to show that for each m greater than or equal to 1 and for all agents i 1, i 2, . . . , i m in N,

omega in K i 1K i 2 . . . K i m( E )

We prove the result by induction on m. The m = 1 case follows at once from ( L1 ) and ( L3 ). Now if we assume that for m = k, omega in L*N ( E ) implies omega in K i 1K i 2 . . . K i k( E ), then L*N ( E ) subset K i 1K i 2 . . . K i k( E ) because omega is an arbitrary possible world, so K i 1( A* ) subset K i 1K i 2 . . . K i k( E ) by ( L3 ). Since ( L2 ) is the case and the agents of N are A*-symmetric reasoners,

K i 1( A* ) subset K i 1K i 2 . . . K i k( E )

for any i k+1 in N, so omega in K i 1K i 2 . . . K i k( E ) by ( L1 ), which completes the induction since i 1, i k+1, i 2, . . . , i k are k + 1 arbitrary agents of N. QED

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Copyright © 2002
Peter Vanderschraaf
peterv@cyrus.andrew.cmu.edu

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