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Proof of Proposition 3.1

Proposition 3.1.
Let Omega be a finite set of states of the world. Suppose that
( i ) Agents i and j have a common prior probability distribution mu(dot) over the events of Omega such that mu( omega ) > 0 for each omega in Omega, and

( ii ) It is common knowledge at omega that i's posterior probability of event E is q i( E ) and that j's posterior probability of E is q j( E ).

Then q i( E ) = q j( E ).

Proof.
Let calligraphic-M be the meet of all the agents' partitions, and let calligraphic-M( omega ) be the element of calligraphic-M containing omega. Since calligraphic-M( omega ) consists of cells common to every agents information partition, we can write

calligraphic-M( omega ) =
union
k
H ik,

where each H ik in calligraphic-Hi. Since i's posterior probability of event E is common knowledge, it is constant on calligraphic-M( omega ), and so

q i( E ) = mu( E | H ik ) for all k

Hence,

mu( E intersect H ik ) = q i( E ) mu( H ik )

and so

mu( E intersect calligraphic-M( omega ) )
=
mu( E intersect
union
k
H ik )
=
mu(
union
k
E intersect H ik )
=

sum
k
mu( E intersect H ik )
=

sum
k
q i( E ) mu( H ik )
=
q i ( E )
sum
k
mu( H ik )
=
q i( E ) mu(
union
k
H ik )
= q i( E ) mu( calligraphic-M( omega ) )

Applying the same argument to j, we have

mu( E intersect calligraphic-M( omega ) ) = q j( E ) mu( calligraphic-M ( omega ) )

so we must have q i( E ) = q j( E ). QED

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Copyright © 2002
Peter Vanderschraaf
peterv@cyrus.andrew.cmu.edu

Supplement to Common Knowledge
Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy