| This is a file in the archives of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy. |
Let T2 denote the
number of messages that Joanna's e-mail system sends, and
T1 denote the number of messages that Lizzi's
e-mail system sends. We might suppose that
Ti appears on each agent's computer
screen. If T1 = 0, then Lizzi sends no message,
that is,
1
has occurred, in which case Lizzi's unique best response is to
choose A. If T2 = 0, then Joanna did
not receive a message. She knows that in this case, either
1
has occurred and Lizzi did not send her a message, which occurs with
probability .51, or
2
has occurred and Lizzi sent her a message which did not arrive,
which occurs with probability
.49
.
If 1
has occurred, then Lizzi is sure to choose A, so Joanna
knows that whatever Lizzi might do at
2,
E(u2(A) | T2=0) 2(.51) + 0(.49)
.51 + .49> 4(.51) + 2(.49)
.51 + .49E(u2(B) | T2=0 )
so Joanna is strictly better off choosing A no matter what Lizzi does at either state of the world.
Suppose next that for all Ti < t,
each agents' unique best response given her expectations
regarding the other agent is A, so that the unique Nash
equilibrium of the game is (A,A). Assume that
T1 = t. Lizzi is uncertain whether
T2 = t, which is the case if Joanna
received Lizzi's tth automatic confirmation and
Joanna's tth confirmation was lost, or if
T2 = t
1, which is the case if Lizzi's tth confirmation
was lost. Then
1(T2 = t
= z =
> ½.[1]
Thus it is more likely that Lizzi's last confirmation did not arrive
than that Joanna did receive this message. By the inductive
assumption, Lizzi assesses that Joanna will choose A if
T2 =
t1.
So
and
E(u1(B) | T1 = t) 
= < =
E(u1(A) | T1 = t) = 0since Lizzi knows that
2 is the case. So
Lizzi's unique best action is A. Similarly, one can show
that A is Joanna's best reply if T2 =
t. So by induction, (A,A) is the unique
Nash equilibrium of the game for every t
0.
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| Peter Vanderschraaf peterv@cyrus.andrew.cmu.edu |