Notes
1.
Condillac's argument
for the immateriality of the soul is a version of an argument that Kant
dubbed "the Achilles of all rationalist inferences in the pure doctrine
of the soul." Versions can be found in the works of a number of other
early modern philosophers, including Mendelssohn and Bayle, and it was
often invoked by those attacking Locke's notorious suggestion that God
could have endowed matter with the capacity of thought. As Condillac
presented it, the argument proceeds by establishing that thought could
not be attributed to an extended being, and so must be the property of
an unextended and hence immaterial substance. To establish this point
Condillac observed that any extended being is composed of parts that
exist outside of one another and that therefore can be separated from
one another. Consequently, any extended substance is actually a
composite of many independently existing substances. Were thought
attributed to such a being, it would either have to be attributed to
these substances individually (in which case each substance would have
its own copy of the thought) or collectively (in which case the one
thought would be divided up among the substances). But neither option
is elligible. Condillac did not bother to give an explicit reason for
rejecting the first. Presumably he supposed that it is too extravagant,
insofar as it needlessly multiplies the number of substances that are
supposed to have the thought, and that it conceeds the case, insofar as
it allows that thought can only occur in an indivisible substance. He
did, however, give explicit reasons for rejecting the second
possibility: Thoughts may themselves be taken to be either simple or
compound. Simple thoughts can, ipso facto not be divided into
parts and so cannot be parceled out among a number of substances.
Compound thoughts can be divided into their simple components, but were
these components parceled out to a number of substances, each substance
would only know the component alotted to it, and none would know the
whole that they add up to. The fact that we do know the whole of a
compound thought thus suggests that this thought is grasped by
something that is itself simple and indivisible, and hence immaterial.
This argument was subjected to devastating criticism by Hume in Book
I, Part iv, Section 5 of his Treatise, and Condillac's
ignorance of Hume’s objections (which were so serious and so
directly opposed to Condillac's argument that he could hardly have
ignored them had he been aware of their existence) strongly suggests
that he had no knowledge of Hume's Treatise.
2.
The one positive
suggestion Condillac had to make about how the mind might acquire
information about distance outwards was undeveloped and offered only
incidentally, in the process of replying to an objection. He suggested
that we might acquire information about distance outwards from the
number of intervening objects lying along the ground between ourselves
and a distant object (Essay I.vi. §10). This is hardly a
satisfactory alternative. Either it begs the question, by presupposing
that the intervening objects are seen one behind the other (as opposed
to one above the other), or it gives up the point, by allowing that we
do not immediately see depth but instead infer it from features of what
is actually only a two-dimensional display, in which objects along the
ground are seen at increasingly smaller distances below the horizon,
and so only as above and below one another.