p,
therefore Np
Beta: Np, N(p ⊃ q), therefore Nq.
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The thesis of determinism says that everything that happens is determined by antecedent conditions together with the laws of nature. Incompatibilism is the philosophical thesis that if determinism is true, then we don't have free will. The denial of incompatibilism is compatibilism; a compatibilist is someone who believes that the truth of determinism does not rule out the existence of free will. The philosophical problem of free will and determinism is the problem of understanding how, if at all, the truth of determinism is compatible with the truth of our commonsense belief that we have free will. That is, it's the problem of deciding who is right: the compatibilist or the incompatibilist.
Why an encyclopedia entry on arguments for incompatibilism? Perhaps for this reason: until fairly recently, compatibilism was the received view and it was widely believed that arguments for incompatibilism rest on a modal fallacy or fairly obvious mistake (e.g., the mistake of confusing causation with compulsion, or the mistake of confusing descriptive with prescriptive laws) (Ayer 1954). Compatibilists have also tended to dismiss incompatibilism because of its guilt by association with a metaphysical worldview that P. F. Strawson famously dismissed as “obscure and panicky” — dualism, agent-causation (Strawson 1962). Indeed, thanks to Strawson's seminal paper, many compatibilists are convinced that the free will/determinism problem is not a metaphysical problem at all (as opposed to a problem about moral responsibility which arises within normative ethics or metaethics). And even those compatibilists who regard the free will problem as a metaphysical problem have, for the most part, been pre-occupied with defending free will against those who argue that free will is either impossible or empirically implausible regardless of whether determinism is true or false. And so the literature on the problem of free will and determinism has come to be dominated by incompatibilists.
In the literature, “determinism” is sometimes used as an umbrella term for a variety of different claims which have traditionally been regarded as threats to free will. Given this usage, the thesis that I am calling “determinism” is just one of many kinds of determinism, and the problem of free will and causal or nomological determinism is regarded as one of a family of related problems. For instance, logical determinism is the thesis that the principle of bivalence holds for all propositions, including propositions about our future actions, and the problem of free will and logical determinism is the problem of understanding how, if at all, we can have free will if it's already true, “ahead of time”, what we will do tomorrow. Theological determinism is the thesis that God exists and has infallible knowledge of all true propositions including propositions about our future actions; the problem of free will and theological determinism is the problem of understanding how, if at all, we can have free will if God (who cannot be mistaken) already knows what we are going to do. (For more on logical determinism, see the entry on fatalism, Lewis 1976, and Taylor 1967. For more on theological determinism, see the entries on fatalism and divine foreknowledge.) Although there are instructive comparisions to be made concerning logical, theological, and causal determinism, these are outside the scope of this article. We will be restricting ourselves to causal determinism, and to arguments for the claim that free will is incompatible with causal determinism.
At a first approximation, causal determinism (henceforth “determinism”), is a thesis about the laws of nature: that they are deterministic rather than probabilistic, and that they are all-encompassing rather than limited in scope. At a second approximation, laws are deterministic if they entail exceptionless regularities; e.g., that all F's are G's, that all ABCD's are E's, and so on. At a third approximation, the fundamental laws of nature are probabilistic if they say that F's have an objective chance N (less than 1) of having property G. (Note that so-called “statistical laws” need not be probabilistic laws; see Armstrong 1983, Loewer 1996a.) The laws of nature are all-encompassing if the laws apply to everything in spacetime, without any exceptions. If, on the other hand, some creatures (e.g., angels) or some parts of some creatures (e.g., the nonphysical minds of human beings) or some of the behaviors of some of the creatures (e.g., the free actions of human beings) are not governed by either deterministic or probabilistic laws, then the laws are not all-encompassing.
Given these rough definitions of the difference between deterministic laws, probabilistic laws, and limited laws, we can understand determinism as the thesis that a complete description of the state of the world at any time t and a complete statement of the laws of nature together entail every truth about what happens at every time later than t. Alternatively, and using the language of possible worlds: Determinism is true at a possible world w iff the following is true at that world: Any world which has the same laws of nature as w and which is exactly like w at any time t is exactly like w at all times which are future relative to t (see van Inwagen 1983, Ginet 1990, and the entry on causal determinism).
Let's call a world “deterministic” iff the thesis of determinism is true at that world; non-deterministic iff the thesis of determinism is false at that world. There are two very different ways in which a world might be non-deterministic. A world might be non-deterministic because at least some of the fundamental laws are probabilistic, or a world might be non-deterministic because it has no laws or because its laws are not all-encompassing. Let's call worlds which are non-deterministic in only the first way “probabilistic worlds” and let's call worlds which are non-deterministic in the second way “lawless” or “partly lawless” worlds.
Note that determinism is not a thesis about predictability. Determinism is a thesis about the kind of laws that govern a world; it says nothing about whether these laws are knowable by finite beings, let alone whether they could, even in principle, be used to predict all future events. Chaos theory tells us that some deterministic systems are very difficult to predict. Quantum mechanics tells us, at least according to some interpretations, that the behavior of probabilistic systems is, in some respects, very easy to predict. And it is at least arguable that the behavior of a perfectly rational but lawless or partly lawless creature is highly predictable.
Note that determinism is not a thesis about causation; in particular, it is not the thesis that every event has a cause. If, as many people now believe, the fundamental laws are probabilistic rather than deterministic, this doesn't mean that there is no causation; it just means that we have to revise our theories of causation to fit the facts. And this is what philosophers of causation have done; there are probabilistic versions of “covering law” theories of causation, of counterfactual theories of causation, and so on, for all major theories of causation. (See entries on the metaphysics of causation and counterfactual theories of causation.) It is now generally accepted that it may be true that every event has a cause even though determinism is false and thus some events lack sufficient or deterministic causes.
More controversially, it might be true that every event has a cause even if our world is neither deterministic nor probabilistic. If there can be causes without laws (if God or an angel or a person can be a cause, for instance, without instantiating a law), then it might be true, even at a lawless or partly lawless world, that every event has a cause (Anscombe 1981).
It's less clear whether determinism entails the thesis that every event has a cause. Whether it does so or not depends on what the correct theory of causation is; in particular, it depends on what the correct theory says about the relation between causation and law.
What is clear, however, is that we should not make the assumption, almost universally made in the older literature, that the Every Event has a Cause thesis is equivalent to the thesis of determinism. This is an important point, because some of the older arguments in the literature against incompatibilism assume that the two claims are equivalent.
In the older literature, it was assumed that determinism is the working hypothesis of science, and that to reject determinism is to be against science. This no longer seems plausible. Some people think that quantum mechanics has shown determinism to be false. This remains controversial (Loewer 1996b), but it is now generally agreed that we can reject determinism without accepting the view that the behavior of human beings falls outside the scope of the laws. If mechanism is the thesis that human behavior can be explained in the same kind of way — in terms of events, natural processes, and laws of nature — as everything else, then we can reject determinism without rejecting mechanism.
Note, finally, that determinism neither entails physicalism nor is entailed by it. There are possible worlds where determinism is true and physicalism false; e.g., worlds where minds are nonphysical things which nevertheless obey deterministic laws. (van Inwagen 1998) And there are possible worlds (perhaps our own) where physicalism is true and determinism false.
Incompatibilism is the thesis that if determinism is true, then (for that reason) we don't have free will. That is, an incompatibilist is someone who thinks that whether or not we have free will depends on a contingent fact about the laws that govern the universe: we have free will only if we are lucky enough to be living in a universe which is non-deterministic.
In the older literature, there were just two kinds of incompatibilists — hard determinists and libertarians. A hard determinist is an incompatibilist who believes that determinism is true (or, perhaps, believes that it is close enough to being true so far as we are concerned, in the ways relevant to free will) and because of this we lack free will (Holbach 1770, Darrow 1924). A libertarian is an incompatibilist who believes that we in fact have free will and that this entails that determinism is false, in the right kind of way. Traditionally, libertarians have believed that “the right kind of way” requires that agents have a special and mysterious causal power not had by anything else in nature: a godlike power to be an uncaused cause of changes in the world (Campbell 1957, Chisholm 1964). Libertarians who hold this view are committed, it seems, to the claim that free will is possible only at worlds which are at least partly lawless. But in the contemporary literature there are libertarians who avoid such risky metaphysical claims; libertarians who argue that free will is possible at probabilistic worlds (Kane 1996, Balaguer 1999). And there are incompatibilists who are agnostic about the truth or falsity of determinism (Ginet 1990) and thus are neither hard determinists nor libertarians. Not all incompatibilists have a positive account of free will and some are more optimistic than others about the prospect of working out a plausible account of free will (Van Inwagen 1998, 2000). But all incompatibilists agree that a necessary condition of free will is that determinism is false. (See the entry on incompatibilist theories of free will.)
Compatibilism is, minimally, the denial of incompatibilism; the compatibilist is someone who rejects the claim that the truth of determinism would mean that we lack free will. Note that given this minimal definition, a compatibilist might be a free will nihilist: someone who believes that we lack free will regardless of the truth or falsity of determinism because our concept of free will is “incoherent” or self-inconsistent or includes conditions not satisfiable at any possible world (G. Strawson 1986 and 2002, Smilansky 2000). And given this minimal definition, a compatibilist might be a fatalist: someone who believes that we lack free will because the principle of bivalence (logical determinism) is true. However, most compatibilists believe that we in fact have free will and nearly all compatibilists would accept the following, slightly less minimal, definition of compatibilism: Compatibilism is the thesis that we in fact have free will and that even if determinism turned out to be true, we would still have free will. Or, as compatibilists sometimes like to say: the facts as we know them give us good enough reason to believe that we have free will; the discovery that determinism is true would not and should not undermine our belief that we have free will.
Given these definitions and distinctions, we can now take the first step towards clarifying the disagreement between compatibilists and incompatibilists. Compatibilists and incompatibilists agree about one thing: that there are possible worlds where we (or creatures very much like us) have free will. That is, neither compatibilists nor incompatibilists are free will nihilists or fatalists. Compatibilists believe that the worlds where we have free will include deterministic worlds; incompatibilists believe that the only worlds where we have free will are non-deterministic worlds. Arguments for incompatibilism must, then, be arguments for the conclusion that a contingent fact about the world — determinism — makes a difference to our having free will.
A common first response to determinism is to think that it means that our choices make no difference to anything that happens because earlier causes have predetermined or “fixed” our entire future. On this view, determinism implies that we have a destiny or fate that we cannot avoid, no matter how hard we try.
Man, in running over, frequently without his own knowledge, frequently in spite of himself, the route which nature has marked out for him, resembles a swimmer who is obliged to follow the current that carries him along; he believes himself a free agent because he sometimes consents, sometimes does not consent, to glide with the stream, which, notwithstanding, always hurries him forward. (Holbach 1770, p. 197)
It is widely agreed, by incompatibilists as well as compatibilists, that this is a mistake. Determinism might imply that our choices and efforts have earlier sufficient causes; it does not imply that we don't make choices or that our choices, and efforts are not causally efficacious. Determinism is consistent with the fact that our deliberation, choices and efforts are part of the causal process whereby we do things. And a cause is the kind of thing which “make a difference”. If I raise my hand because I chose to do so, then it's true, ceteris paribus, that if my choice had not occurred, my hand-raising would not have occurred.
Putting aside this worry, we may classify arguments for incompatibilism as falling into one of two categories:
Arguments of the first kind focus on the notions of self, causation, and action; the worry is that determinism rules out the kind of causation that we invoke when we attribute actions to persons (“It was Suzy who broke the window”) and make judgments of responsibility. Someone who argues for incompatibilism in this way may concede that the truth of determinism is consistent with the causal efficacy of our reasons, intentions, and choices. But, she insists, determinism implies that the only sense in which we are responsible for our actions is the sense in which a chess-playing computer is responsible for its moves. Free will (or at least free will in the sense required for moral responsibility) requires something more than this, she believes. Free will requires self-determination: that our actions are caused and controlled by our selves.
Each of us, when we act, is a prime mover unmoved. In doing what we do, we cause certain events to happen, and nothing — or no one — causes us to cause these events to happen. (Chisholm 1964, p. 32)
Free will…is the power of agents to be the ultimate creators or originators and sustainers of their own ends or purposes…when we trace the causal or explanatory chains of action back to their sources in the purposes of free agents, these causal chains must come to an end or terminate in the willings (choices, decisions, or efforts) of the agents, which cause or bring about their purposes. (Kane 1996, p. 4)
Arguments of the second kind focus on the notion of choice. To have a choice, it seems, is to have genuine options or alternatives — different ways in which one can act. The worry is that determinism entails that what we do is the only thing we can do, and that because of this we never really have a choice about anything, as opposed to being under the (perhaps inescapable) illusion that we have a choice. Someone who argues for incompatibilism in this way may concede that the truth of determinism is consistent with our making choices, at least in the sense in which a chess-playing computer make choices, and consistent also with our choices being causally effective. But, she insists, this is not enough for free will; we have free will only if we have a genuine choice about what actions we perform, and we have a genuine choice only if there is more than one action we can perform.
A man has free will if he is often in positions like these: he must now speak or be silent, and he can now speak and can now remain silent; he must attempt to rescue a drowning child or else go for help, and he is able to attempt to rescue the child and able to go for help; he must now resign his chairmanship or else lie to the members; and he has it within his power to resign and he has it within his power to lie. (van Inwagen 1983, p. 8)By freedom of the will is meant freedom of action. I have freedom of action at a given moment if more than one alternative course of action is then open to me. Two or more actions are alternatives if it is logically impossible for me to do more than one of them at the same time. Two or more alternatives are open to me at a given moment if which of them I do is entirely up to my choice at that moment. Nothing that exists up to that moment in time stands in the way of my doing next any one of the alternatives. (Ginet 1990, p. 90)
One might question whether these are really independent ways of arguing for incompatibilism, for the following reason: We cause our actions in the “right kind of way” (let's call it the “self-determining way”) only if we have the power to choose and do otherwise. And if we have the power to choose and do otherwise, then we also have the power (even if we don't always exercise it) to cause our actions in the self-determining way. That is, there is just one power at issue, not two. The power to cause one's actions in the self-determining way is the same power as the power to choose and do otherwise. And if there is just one power, then either determinism entails that we lack this power or it does not.
There is something to this suggestion. It seems that what distinguishes us from a chess playing computer (or an even more sophisticated machine) is something that makes it true that our actions are up to us in some way that the “actions” of even the most intelligent machines are not. And if our actions are up to us in some special way, then it seems reasonable to suppose that it's true both that our power to cause our actions differs from the causal powers of machines and that this difference consists in the fact that we can choose and perform more than one action.
However, the claim that the power to choose and do otherwise and the power of self-determination are one and the same is controversial. Harry Frankfurt has argued that a person who cannot choose or do otherwise may nevertheless cause his action in “the right kind of way” (self-determining, understood however you like). If he is right, then the power to cause one's actions in the self-determining way does not entail the power to choose or do otherwise (Frankfurt 1969).
Since there is nothing like a consensus concerning Frankfurt's claim, we will not assume that there is just one power at issue. Nor will we assume that either of these powers must be understood in a way that entails incompatibilism. That is, we won't assume that the power of self-determination entails the falsity of determinism. An influential compatibilist program identifies a person's self with some subset of her motives (e.g., her values) and then argues that a person's free and responsible actions are those actions which have their source in the agent's self thus understood (Frankfurt 1971, 1988, Watson 1975, Wolf 1990). Nor will we assume that the power to choose and do otherwise entails the power to do otherwise, given the past and laws, which entails the falsity of determinism. This might be true, but we need an argument.
Perhaps the most common kind of argument for incompatibilism is an argument that appeals primarily to our intuitions. There are many variations on this way of arguing for incompatibilism, but the basic structure of the argument is usually something along these lines:
If determinism is true, then we are like: billiard balls, windup toys, playthings of external forces, puppets, robots, victims of a nefarious neurosurgeon who controls us by manipulating our brain states, etc. Billiard balls, … have no free will. Therefore if determinism is true, we don't have free will.
Intuition pump arguments are inconclusive. Even if determinism entails that there is something we have in common with things which lack free will, it doesn't follow that there are no relevant differences. Billiard balls, toys, puppets, and simple robots lack minds, and it seems reasonable to suppose that having a mind is a necessary condition of having free will. (For criticism of “intuition pumps”, see Dennett 1984.)
What about the victim of the nefarious neurosurgeon? Here we need to be careful; we need to ask what the details of the story are and ask why this person lacks free will. If we look more closely at the stories, it turns out that one of two reasons is usually given: either the neurosurgeon's victim doesn't cause his actions in the right, self-determining way or he cannot do, or even choose to do, anything other than what he actually does.
These are both good reasons for believing that someone lacks free will. The question, however, is whether determinism has either of these consequences. To evaluate this, we need something more than an Intuition Pump argument.
Before we turn to these arguments, there is one Intuition Pump argument that deserves special attention: The Road with no Branches argument (Van Inwagen 1993, Fischer 1994, Ekstrom 2000).
This argument begins by appealing to the idea that whenever we make a choice we are doing (or think we are doing) something like what a traveler does when faced with a choice between different roads. The only roads the traveler is able to choose are roads which are a continuation of the road he is already on. By analogy, the only choices we are able to make are choices which are a continuation of the actual past and consistent with the laws of nature. If determinism is false, then making choices really is like this: one “road” (the past) behind us, two or more different “roads” (future actions consistent with the laws) in front of us. But if determinism is true, then our journey through life is like traveling (in one direction only) on a road which has no branches. There are other roads, leading to other destinations; if we could get to one of these other roads, we could reach a different destination. But we can't get to any of these other roads from the road we are actually on. So if determinism is true, our actual future is our only possible future; we can never choose or do anything other than what we actually do.
This is a powerful intuition pump, since it's natural to think of our future as being “open” in the branching way suggested by the road analogy and to associate this kind of branching structure with freedom of choice. But several crucial assumptions have been smuggled into this picture: assumptions about time and causation and assumptions about possibility. The assumptions about time and causation needed to make the analogy work seem to include the following: that we “move” through time in something like the way that we move down a road, that our “movement” is necessarily in one direction only, from past to future, that the past is necessarily “fixed” or beyond our control in some way that the future is not. These assumptions are all controversial; on some theories of time and causation (the 4D theory of time, a theory of causation that permits time travel and backwards causation), they are all false (Lewis 1976, Horwich 1987, Sider 2001).
The assumption about possibility is that possible worlds are concrete spatiotemporal things (in the way that roads are) and that worlds can overlap (literally share a common part) in the way that roads can overlap. But most possible worlds theorists reject both assumptions and nearly everyone rejects the second assumption (Adams 1974, Lewis 1986).
Determinism (without these additional assumptions) does not imply that our “journey” through life is like moving down a road; the contrast between determinism and non-determinism is not the contrast between traveling on a branching road and traveling on a road with no branches.
If this intuition pump nevertheless continues to engage us, it is because we think that our range of possible choices is constrained by two factors: the laws and the past. We can't change or break the laws; we cannot causally affect the past. (Even if backwards causation is logically possible, it is not within our power.) These two premises are the basis of the best known contemporary argument for incompatibilism: the Consequence argument. More of this later.
What has this boy to do with it? He was not his own father; he was not his own mother; he was not his own grandparents. All of this was handed to him. He did not surround himself with governesses and wealth. He did not make himself. And yet he is to be compelled to pay. (Darrow 1924, p. 103)Libertarians and incompatibilists do not want indeterminism for its own sake…indeterminism is something of a nuisance for them. It gets in the way and creates all sorts of trouble. What they want is ultimate responsibility and ultimate responsibility requires indeterminism. (Kane 1989, p. 121)
Another way of arguing for incompatibilism is a variation on an argument that we may call “the desperate defense attorney's argument”. The defense attorney's argument is simple:
The defense attorney is trying to persuade the jurors that his client is not responsible for his action, but not for any of the standard excusing conditions — insanity, accident, mistaken belief, duress, mental handicap, and so on. Nor does he claim that there is anything that distinguishes his client from any of the rest of us. His argument is that his client is not responsible because he did not make himself. But none of us has made ourselves (at least not from scratch) — we are all the products of heredity and environment. So if we accept the defense attorney's argument, we are committed to the conclusion that no one is ever responsible for anything.
It's not clear that this is an argument for incompatibilism. It's an argument for incompatibilism only if it's an argument for hard determinism — that is, if it's an argument for the thesis that determinism is true and because of this we are never responsible for anything. Let's take a closer look.
What's the argument for premise (2)? After all, we do make our selves, at least in the sense in which we make other things: we plant gardens, cook dinners, build boats, write books and, over the course of our lives, re-invent, re-create, and otherwise “make something of ourselves”. Of course we don't do any of these things “from scratch”, but it's impossible (or at least impossible for human beings) to make anything from scratch. The truth or falsity of determinism has no bearing on this point.
(See G. Strawson, 1986 and 2002 for an argument for the impossibility of “true responsibility” that is based on a more sophisticated version of the defense attorney's argument. See also Hospers 1961 and Smilansky 2000.)
If we pressed our defense attorney (or brought in a philosopher to help him out), we might get the following reply: Making our actions (and thereby our selves) in the way that we make dinners, gardens, boats, and books is not good enough because we are talking about moral responsibility. In order to be truly responsible — in a way that allows us to justify blame and punishment — for our actions we must be the ultimate sources or first causes of our actions. Of course we can't be the sole causes of our actions; we have to work with the raw material of our physical bodies and that part of the way we are(our beliefs, desires, etc.) that is the product of external causes. And of course the success of our choice or attempt to act depends on factors outside our control (Nagel 1976). But in order to be responsible for the upshots of our choices, we must at least be responsible for our choices. And we are responsible for our choices only if we cause our choices and no one and nothing causes us to cause them.
The defense attorney is defending premise (2) by arguing for a certain interpretation of premise (1) — that moral responsibility for actions requires that we have “made ourselves” in the sense that, over the course of our lives, we have frequently been the first cause of the choices that result in actions and thus eventually (albeit often in ways we can neither predict nor control) to changes in our selves. In arguing this way, he has shifted the focus of the argument from the obviously impossible demand that moral responsibility requires (entirely) self-made selves to the intuitively appealing and at least not obviously impossible demand that moral responsibility requires what Robert Kane has called “ultimate responsibility” (that we are, somehow, the sources or first or ultimate causes of our actions, or at least some of our actions). (See Kane 1996. See also Campbell 1957, Chisolm 1964 and 1976, Clarke 1993 and 1996, O'Connor 2000, and Zimmerman 1984.)
Insofar as this is an argument for incompatibilism, it is an argument for the claim that determinism entails that we are mere links in a causal chain and therefore merely the proximate causes of our actions. Our choices cause our actions, but our choices are caused by our beliefs and desires (or values, reasons, character traits, etc.) and these in turn have external causes. So if determinism is true, then the way in which our actions are caused does not, after all, differ in any relevant way, from the way that the ‘actions’ of the chess-playing computer are caused.
This brings us to the philosopher's version of the defense attorney's argument:
Premise (2) follows from the definition of determinism (at least given two widely accepted assumptions: that there is causation in a deterministic universe and that causation is a transitive relation). (For some doubts about the latter assumption, see Hall 2000, and Hitchcock 2001). Premise (3) is clearly true. So if we want to reject the conclusion, we must reject Premise (1).
Compatibilists have argued against (1) in two different ways. On the positive side, they have argued that we can give a satisfactory account of the (admittedly elusive) notion of self-determination without insisting that self-determination requires us to be the first causes of our actions (Bok 1998, Dennett 1984, Fischer 1994, Frankfurt 1971 and 1988, Wallace 1994, Watson 1975 and 1987, Wolf 1990). On the negative side, compatibilists have challenged (1) by arguing that it is of no help to the incompatibilist: if we accept (1), we are committed to the conclusion that free will and moral responsibility are impossible, regardless of whether determinism is true or false.
The challenge to (1) takes the form of a dilemma: Either determinism is true or it's not. If determinism is true, then my actions are ultimately caused by events and conditions outside my control, so I am not their first cause and therefore, if we accept (1), I am neither free nor responsible. If determinism is false, then something that happens inside me (something that I call “my choice” or “my decision”) might be the first event in a causal chain leading to a sequence of body movements that I call “my action”. But since this event is not causally determined, whether or not it happens is a matter of chance or luck. Whether or not it happens has nothing to do with me; it is not under my control any more than an involuntary knee jerk is under my control. Therefore, if determinism is false, I am not the first cause or source of my actions and, if we accept (1), I am neither free nor responsible (Ayer 1954, Wolf 1990).
In order to defend (1) against the so-called “determined or random” dilemma, above, the incompatibilist has to offer a positive account of the puzzling claim that persons are the first causes of their actions. The traditional incompatibilist answer is that this claim must be taken literally, at face value. We — agents, persons, enduring things — are causes with a very special property: we initiate causal chains, but nothing and no one causes us to do this. Like God, we are uncaused causers, or first movers. For instance, if Joe deliberately throws a rock, which breaks a window, then the window's breaking (an event) was caused by Joe's throwing the rock (another event), which was caused by Joe's choice (another event). But Joe's choice was not caused by any further event, not even the event of Joe's thinking it might be fun to throw the rock; it was caused by Joe himself. And since Joe is not an event, he is not the kind of thing which can be caused. (Or so it is argued, by the proponents of agent-causation. See Campbell 1957, Chisolm 1964 and 1976, Clarke 1993 and 1996, O'Connor 2000.)
Many philosophers think that agent-causation is either incoherent or impossible, due to considerations about causation. What sense does it make to say that a person or other enduring thing, as opposed to a change in a thing, or the state of a thing at a certain time, is a cause?
Others (Broad 1952, van Inwagen 2000) have argued that even if the idea is coherent, and even if agent-causation is both possible and actual, it would not solve the problem of transforming an undetermined event into one which is in our control.
Recently some incompatibilists have responded to the “determined or random” dilemma in a different way: by appealing to the idea of probabilistic causation (Kane 1996). If our choices are events which have probabilistic causes (e.g., our reasons), then it no longer seems plausible to say that we have no control over them. We make choices for reasons, and our reasons cause our choices, albeit indeterministically. Kane's reply may go some way towards avoiding the second horn of the dilemma. But it doesn't avoid the first horn. If our reasons cause our choices, then our choices are not the first causes of our actions. And our reasons are presumably caused, either deterministically or probabilistically, so they are not the first causes either. And so on. But then our actions are ultimately caused by earlier events over which we have no control and we are not the sources or first causes of our actions.
… determinism … professes that those parts of the universe already laid down absolutely appoint and decree what the other parts shall be. The future has no ambiguous possibilities hidden in the womb. The part that we call the present is compatible with only one totality. Any other future complement than the one fixed from eternity is impossible. The whole is in each and every part, and welds it with the rest into an absolute unity, an iron block, in which there can be no equivocation or shadow of turning…. necessity on the one hand and impossibility on the other are the sole categories of the real. Possibilities that fail to get realized, are, for determinism, pure illusions; they never were possibilities at all. (James, 1884, p. 150-51)
We think that we make choices, and we think that our choices typically make a difference to our future. We think that there is a point to deliberation: how we deliberate — what reasons we consider — makes a difference to what we choose and thus to what we do. We also think that when we deliberate we are trying to decide which, of many possible futures, is the one we want to make actual. That is, we believe that there really is more than one choice we can make, more than one action we can perform, and more than one future which is, at least partly, within our power to bring about.
Our beliefs about our power with respect to the future contrast sharply with our beliefs about our lack of power with respect to the past. We don't think we have any choice about the past. We don't deliberate about the past; we think it irrational to do anything aimed at trying to change or affect the past. (“You had your chance; you blew it. It's too late now to do anything about it.”) Our beliefs about our options, opportunities, alternatives, possibilities, abilities, powers, and so on, are all future-directed. We may summarize this contrast by saying that we think that the future is “open” in some sense that contrasts with the non-openness or “fixity” of the past.
Although we don't think we (now) have a choice about the past, we have beliefs about what was possible for us in the past. When called upon to defend what we did, or when we blame or reproach ourselves, or simply wonder whether we did the right thing (or the sensible thing, the rational thing, and so on), we evaluate our action by comparing it to what we believe were our other possible actions, at that time. We blame, criticise, reproach, regret, and so on, only insofar as we believe we had alternatives. And if we later discover that we were mistaken in believing that some action X was among our alternatives, we think it is irrational to criticise or regret our failure to do X.
(For an influential challenge to the claim that moral responsibility requires “alternative possibilities”, see Frankfurt 1969 and Fischer 1994. For criticism of Frankfurt's argument, see Vihvelin 2000b.)
Is determinism compatible with the truth of these beliefs? In particular, is it compatible with the belief that we can often choose and do more than one action?
Incompatibilists have traditionally said “No”. And it's not hard to see why. If we think of ‘can’ in the “open future” way suggested by the commonsense view, then it's tempting to think that the past is necessary in some absolute sense. And it's natural to think that we can do otherwise only if we can do otherwise given the past; that is, only if our doing otherwise is a possible continuation of the past. If we follow this train of thought, we will conclude that we can do otherwise only if our doing otherwise is a possible continuation of the past consistent with the laws. But if determinism is true, there is only one possible continuation of the past consistent with the laws. And thus we get James' conclusion: Determinism says that the actual future is necessary and any other future is impossible. What will be, must be. What will not be, cannot be.
But this argument is too quick. There is an alternative explanation for our beliefs about the “open” future as opposed to the “fixed” past — the direction of causation. Causal chains run from past to future, and not in the other direction. Our deliberation causes our choices, which cause our actions. But not the other way around. Our choices cause future events; they never cause past events. Why causation works this way is a deep and difficult question, but the leading view, among philosophers of science, is that the temporal asymmetry of causation is a fundamental but contingent fact about our universe. If things were different enough — if we could travel backwards in time — then we would have an ability that we don't actually have — the ability to causally affect past persons and things. (Horwich 1987, Lewis 1976) If this is right, then we don't need to suppose that the past is metaphysically or absolutely necessary in order to explain the open future/fixed past contrast. The past could have been different. But, given the way things actually are (given the contingent fact that accounts for the forward direction of causation), there is nothing that we can do that would cause the past to be different. (That is, although there are possible worlds with our laws where the past, relative to any given time t, is different, none of these are worlds where any action of ours after time t causes the earlier events which account for this difference in past history.)
This alternative explanation of our commonsense belief about the contrast between open future and fixed past allows the compatibilist to say the kind of things that compatibilists have traditionally wanted to say: The “can” of freedom of choice is the ‘can’ of causal and counterfactual dependence. Our future is open because it depends causally and counterfactually, on our choices, which in turn depend, causally and counterfactually, on our reasons. (At least in the normal case, where there is neither external constraint nor internal compulsion or other pathology.) If our reasons were different (in the appropriate way), we would choose otherwise, and if we choose otherwise, we would do otherwise (Aune 1982, Moore 1912, Lehrer 1980). And our reasons can be different, at least in the sense that we, unlike simpler creatures and young children, have the ability (skill, capacity) to critically evaluate the reasons (beliefs, desires, values, principles, and so on) that we have and, at least sometimes, the ability to change our reasons (Bok 1998, Dennett 1984, Fischer 1994, Frankfurt 1971 and 1988, Lehrer 1980, Wallace 1994, Watson 1975 and 1987, Wolf 1990). All this is compatible with determinism. So the truth of determinism is compatible with the truth of our commonsense belief that we really do have a choice about the future, that we really can choose and do otherwise.
Incompatiblists think that this, and any compatibilist account of the ‘can’ of freedom of choice, is, and must be, mistaken. But they have traditionally had a hard time explaining why. The Consequence Argument, due chiefly to Ginet and van Inwagen (Ginet 1966, 1980, 1983, 1990, van Inwagen 1974, 1975, 1983; but see also Wiggins 1973 and Lamb 1977) is widely regarded as the best argument for the conclusion that if determinism is true, then no one ever really has a choice about anything. In the remainder of this section we will take a closer look at van Inwagen's version of this important and influential argument.
In An Essay on Free Will (1983), van Inwagen presents three formal arguments which, he says, are intended as three versions of the same basic argument, which he characterized as follows:
If determinism is true, then our acts are the consequence of laws of nature and events in the remote past. But it's not up to us what went on before we were born, and neither is it up to us what the laws of nature are. Therefore, the consequences of these things (including our present acts) are not up to us. (p. 56)
We will begin by looking at the third version of the argument (the modal argument) and conclude by considering David Lewis's criticism of the first (truth-functional) version of the argument.
The modal argument uses a modal sentential operator which van Inwagen defines as follows: ‘N P’ abbreviates ‘P and no one has, or ever had, any choice about whether P’.
Van Inwagen tells us that the logic of ‘N’ includes these two inference rules:
Alpha:Beta: Np, N(p ⊃ q), therefore Nq.
In the argument, ‘L’ is an abbreviation for a sentence
expressing a conjunction of all the laws of nature; ‘H’ is
a sentence expressing a true proposition about the total state of the
world at some time in the distant past before any agents existed;
‘’
is ‘it is logically necessary that’; ‘⊃’
is the material conditional, and ‘P’ is a dummy for which
we may substitute any sentence which expresses a true proposition.
The argument is a conditional proof: Assume determinism and show that it follows that no one has, or ever had, a choice about any true proposition, including propositions about the apparently free actions of human beings.
1. definition of determinism 2. 1, modal and sentential logic 3. N (H ⊃ (L ⊃ P)) 2, Alpha 4. N H premise, fixity of past 5. N (L ⊃ P) 3, 4, Beta 1. N L premise, fixity of laws 7. N P 5, 6 Beta
Premises (1) and (2) follow from determinism. (3) follows from (2), by application of rule Alpha. Rule Alpha is uncontroversial. If something is a logically necessary truth, then no one has, or ever had, any choice about it.
Premises 4 and 6 also look uncontroversial. N necessity isn't logical
or metaphysical necessity. We can insist that the laws and the distant
past could, in the broadly logical sense, have been
different, so neither
H
nor
L
are true. But it still seems undeniably true that we have
no choice about whether the laws and the distant past are the
way they are; there is nothing that we are able to do that
would make it the case that either the laws or the distant past are
different from the way they actually are.
Rule Beta is the key to the argument. It's what makes the difference between the modal version of the Consequence Argument and an argument widely agreed to be fallacious.
P Therefore,
An example of this invalid inference is an argument sometimes called “the fatalist fallacy”:
It's true that it will rain tomorrow
Therefore,
Another example:
H & L
Therefore,
On the other hand, the following is a valid inference:
Therefore,
The necessity expressed by the ‘no choice about’ operator is not logical or metaphysical necessity. But it might nevertheless be similar enough for Beta to be a valid rule of inference. Or so argued van Inwagen, and gave examples:
N (The sun explodes in the year 2000) N(The sun explodes in the year 2000 ⊃ All life on earth ends in the year 2000)
N (All life on earth ends in the year 2000)
An early response to the Consequence argument was to argue that Beta is invalid because a compatibilist account of ability to do otherwise is correct. For instance, if “S can do X” means “if S chose to do X, S would do X”, then the premises of the argument are true (since even if S chose to change the laws or the past, she would not succeed), but the conclusion is false (since determinism is consistent with the truth of conditionals like “if S chose to raise her hand, she would”; Gallois 1977, Narveson 1977, Foley 1979, Slote, 1982, Flint 1987).
Incompatibilists were unmoved by this response, saying, in effect, that the validity of Beta is more plausible than the correctness of any compatibilist account of ‘can’. They pointed out that there was no agreement, even among compatibilists, about how such an account should go, and that the simplest accounts (so-called “Conditional Analyses” of ‘can’) had been rejected, even by compatibilists.
(For criticism of Conditional Analyses, see Austin 1961, Berofsky 2002, Lehrer 1968, van Inwagen 1983. For defense of a compatibilist account of ‘can’, see Aune 1967, Ayers 1968, Benson 1987, Kapitan 1991 and 1996, Lehrer 1980, and Bok 1998. For argument that ‘can’ is not necessary for moral responsibility or any variety of free will worth wanting, see Frankfurt 1969, Dennett 1984, Fischer 1994.)
More recently, van Inwagen has conceded that Beta is invalid (van Inwagen, 2000). McKay and Johnson (1996) showed that Beta entails Agglomeration:
N p N q
Therefore N (p & q)
Agglomeration is uncontroversially invalid. (To see this, let ‘p’ abbreviate ‘The coin does not land heads”, let ‘q’ abbreviate ‘The coin does not land tails’, and suppose that it's a fair coin which isn't tossed but someone could have tossed it.)
Van Inwagen proposed to repair the Consequence argument by replacing ‘N’ with ‘N*’, where ‘N* P’ says ‘P and no one can, or ever could, do anything such that if she did it, P might be false’. Agglomeration is valid for ‘N*’, and thus this particular objection to the validity of Beta does not apply.
It has also been suggested (Finch and Warfield 1998) that the Consequence argument can be repaired by keeping ‘N’ and replacing Beta with Beta 2:
Beta 2: Np, N( L & H) fixity of laws and past
N P 1, 2 Beta 2
These revised versions of the Consequence argument may not be as plausible as the original version, but it still looks as though the compatibilist is in trouble. For it seems plausible to suppose that there is nothing that we can do that might make it the case that either H or L is false. And it seems plausible to suppose that we have no choice about whether (H & L). We need to dig deeper to criticize the argument.
Lewis (1981) begins with a clear and elegant statement of the first version of the argument. Paraphrasing slightly, it goes like this:
Suppose that determinism is true, and that I just put my hand down on my desk. As a compatibilist, I claim that this is a free but determined act. I was able to act otherwise, for instance to raise my hand. But there is a true historical proposition H about the intrinsic state of the world long ago, and a true proposition L specifying the laws of nature, such that H and L jointly determine what I did, and jointly contradict the proposition that I raised my hand. If I had raised my hand, then at least one of three things would have been true: contradictions would have been true, H would not have been true, or L would not have been true. So if I claim that I am able to raise my hand, I am committed to the claim that I have one of three incredible abilities: the ability to make contradictions true, the ability to change the past, or the ability to break (or change) the laws. It's absurd to suppose that I have any of these abilities. Therefore, by reductio, I could not have raised my hand.
Lewis replies by agreeing that if he had raised his hand contradictions would still not be true, and agreeing that if he had raised his hand, H would still have been true. What about L? Lewis draws a distinction between two counterfactuals:
(C1) If I had raised my hand, L would not have been true. (“… a law would have been broken”)(C2) If I had raised my hand, my act would have been or caused an event which entails not-L (“… would have been or caused a law-breaking event”)
Lewis accepts (C1) (for the theory of counterfactuals which supports this claim, see Lewis 1973 and 1979), but denies C2. He then distinguishes between two ability claims:
(A1) I am able to do something such that if I did it, L would not have been true (“…a law would have been broken”)(A2) I am able to do something such that if I did it, my act would have been or caused an event which entails not-L (“…would have been or caused a law-breaking event”)
As a compatibilist who accepts (C1), Lewis is committed to the truth of (A1). But since he rejects (C2), he is not committed to (A2). And it is (A2) rather than (A1) which describes an incredible ability. Or so Lewis argues.
If Lewis is right, the Consequence argument fails to show that any compatibilist account of ‘can do otherwise’ must be mistaken. Lewis is basically saying that the Consequence argument equivocates between two ways of understanding ability claims (when they are applied to propositions) and two correspondingly different ways of understanding the “N” necessity of a proposition. The compatibilist is committed to the claim that free determined agents have the ability to do something such that if they did it, then either H would not have been true or L would not have been true. But this is just another way of saying something that compatibilists have always said: that someone may have the ability to do X even though she would not exercise her ability unless different circumstances obtained. (e.g., circumstances which provide her with reasons for doing X). The compatibilist is not committed to the claim that free determined agents have the ability to cause either the past or the laws to be different. So the compatibilist is not committed to any incredible claims about the abilities of free agents (see also Fischer 1983, 1988, and 1994, Kapitan 1991, 1996, and 2002, Horgan 1985).
If the aim of the Consequence argument was to show that no compatibilist account of ‘could have done otherwise’ can succeed, then Lewis, Fischer, Kapitan, and Horgan are surely right; the reductio fails. The distinction between (A1) and (A2) permits the compatibilist to avoid making incredible claims about the powers of free determined agents. On the other hand, the incompatibilist surely has a point when she complains that it is difficult to believe that anyone has the ability described by (A1). We believe that our powers as agents are constrained by the past and by the laws. Granted, one way to understand this belief is the way the compatibilist suggests: we lack causal power over the past and the laws. But it's natural to understand the constraint in a different, simpler way: we have the power to do only those things which we can do, given the past and the laws. And this leads more or less directly to the incompatibilist conclusion that if determinism is true, then we can never do otherwise.
This brings us back to our starting point. Our commonsense web of beliefs about ourselves as deliberators, choosers, and agents includes the belief that the future is open in some sense that the past is not. It also includes the belief that our abilities and powers are constrained by the laws. One way of understanding these beliefs leads to incompatibilism; another way does not. Which one is right?
The Consequence argument is an attempt to provide an argument in defense of the incompatibilist's way of understanding these commonsense beliefs. Even if it fails as a reductio, it has been successful in other ways. It has made it clear that the free will/determinism problem is a metaphysical problem and that the underlying issues concern questions about our abilities and powers, as well as more general questions about the nature of causation, counterfactuals, and laws of nature. Can the abilities or powers of choosers and agents be understood as a kind of natural capacity or disposition? Is there a viable incompatibilist alternative? How should we understand counterfactuals about the alternative actions and choices of agents at deterministic worlds? Is the compatibilist proposal about the way in which the laws and past constrain us defensible? Are incompatibilists committed to the defense of a particular view about the nature of laws of nature? Are they committed to the rejection of a Humean view, for instance? Insofar as the Consequence argument has pointed us in the direction of these deep and difficult underlying metaphysical questions, it represents a significant step forward in the discussion of one of the most intractable problems of philosophy. (For discussion of some of these issues, see Fischer 1994, Beebee & Mele 2002, Vihvelin 1991 and 2000a.)
| Kadri Vihvelin University of Southern California vihvelin@rcf.usc.edu |
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