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We now show (see Kochen and Specker 1967: , Redhead 1987: 126):
If vectors u(a0) and u(a9), corresponding to points a0 and a9 of the following ten-point KS graph 1 are separated by an angle with 0 sin -1 (1/3), then 1 is realizable.Suppose that , the angle between u(a0) and u(a9), is any acute angle. Since u(a8) is orthogonal to u(a0) and u(a9), and u(a7) also is orthogonal to u(a9), u(a7) must lie in the plane defined by u(a0) and u(a9). Moreover, the direction of u(a7) can be chosen such that, if is the angle between u(a0) and u(a7), then = /2 .
Figure 4: Ten-point KS graph 1
Now, let u(a5) = i and u(a6) = k and choose a third vector j such that i, j, k form a complete set of orthonormal vectors. Then u(a1), being orthogonal to i, may be written as:
u(a1) = (j + xk) (1 + x2) -1/2for a suitable real number x, and similarly u(a2), being orthogonal to k, may be written as:
u(a2) = (i + yj) (1 + y2) -1/2for a suitable real number y. But now the orthogonality relations in the diagram yield:
u(a3) = u(a5) × u(a1) = (-xj + k) (1 + x2) -1/2Now, u(a0) is orthogonal to u(a1) and u(a2), so:u(a4) = u(a2) × u(a6) = (yi j) (1 + y2) -1/2
u(a0) = u(a1) × u(a2) / ( | u(a1) × u(a2) | ) = (-xyi + xj k) (1 + x2 + x2 y2) -1/2Similarly, u(a7) is orthogonal to u(a3) and u(a4), so:
u(a7) = u(a4) × u(a3) / ( | u(a4) × u(a3) | ) = (-i yj xyk) (1 + y2 + x2 y2) -1/2Recalling now that the inner product of two unit vectors just equals the cosine of the angle between them, we get:
u(a0) u(a7) = cos = xy[(1 + x2 + x2 y2) (1 + y2 + x2 y2)] -1/2Thus:
sin = xy[(1 + x2 + x2 y2) (1 + y2 + x2 y2)] -1/2This expression achieves a maxium value of 1/3 for x = y = 1. Hence, the diagram is realizable, if 0 sin-1(1/3), or, equivalently if 0 sin 1/3.
Return to The Kochen-Specker Theorem
Carsten Held carsten.held@uni-erfurt.de |