Chinese Term |
Approximate English Pronunciation |
Bi (other) | “be” as in the verb
“to be” |
Bian (disputation) |
“be-yen!” pronounced as a single syllable |
Ci (expressions) |
“tsuh?” as in
“catsup,” dropping the initial ‘ca’ and final
‘p’ |
Da Qu (“Big Selection”) |
“da!” “chew” |
Fei (not-this, wrong) |
“fey” |
He (matching) |
“her?” without the
final ‘r’ |
Jian ai (inclusive concern) |
“jee-yen,” pronounced as a single syllable;
“I!” as in “I do” |
Ke (admissible) |
“ker” without
the final ‘r’ |
Li (benefit) |
“lee!” |
Mou (drawing parallels) |
“moe?” |
Mozi (classical text) |
“mwo!”
followed by “dz” |
Pi (analogy) |
“pee!” |
Qi (breath, energy) |
“chee!” as in
“cheese” |
Quan (weighing) |
“ch” as in
“cheese” followed by “when?” |
Shi (this, right) |
“shr!” or
“sher!” as in “Sherlock” |
Shí (reality, things, objects) |
“shr?” or
“sher?” as in “Sherlock” |
Shuo (explanation) |
“shwo” |
Tian (heaven) |
“tee-yen,”
pronounced as a single syllable |
Tong (same, similar) |
“tohng?”
(“toe” plus an “-ng?” ending) |
Tui (extending) |
“tway” |
Xi (happiness) |
“shee” as in
‘banshee’ |
Xiao Qu (“Small Selection”) |
“sheow” (rhymes with “meow”)
“chew” |
Xing (shape) |
“sheeng?”
“shee” as in ‘banshee’ plus an
“-ng?” ending |
Xu (empty, hollow) |
like “issue”
without the initial ‘i’ |
Xunzi (classical Confucian text) |
“issue,” without the initial ‘i’ and
adding a final ‘n?’, followed by “dz” |
Yi (thought, intention) |
“e!” (a
clipped pronunciation of the letter “e”) |
Yi (duty, morality) |
“e!” |
Yuan (citing) |
“yoo-wen?,”
pronounced as a single syllable |
Zhi (knowledge) |
“jr!,” roughly
like “jerk” without the final ‘k’ |
Zhi (intention) |
“jr!” |
Zhuangzi (classical Daoist text) |
“joo-wong” pronounced as one syllable, followed
by “dz” |