Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Supplement to Relativism
Citation Information

Table of Contents

More Detailed Table of Contents (to Subsection-Level)

• 1. A Framework for Relativism
  • 1.1 Y is relative to X
  • 1.2 Descriptive Relativism and Normative Relativism
  • 1.3 The Two Faces of Normative Relativism
  • 1.4 Relativism as Presupposing Realism and Inconceivable without It
  • 1.5 A Taxonomy of Positions
  • 1.6 Matters of Degree
  • 1.7 Exceptions and Dispensations: The Exemption Problem
• 2. Dependent Variables: What is Relative?
  • 2.1 Central Concepts
  • 2.2 Central Beliefs
  • 2.3 Perception
  • 2.4 Epistemic Appraisal
  • 2.5 Ethics
  • 2.6 Semantics
  • 2.7 Practice
  • 2.8 Truth
  • 2.9 Reality
  • 2.10 Relationships among the Kinds of Relativism
• 3. Independent Variables: Relative to What?
  • 3.1 Language
  • 3.2 Culture
  • 3.3 Historical Period
  • 3.4 Innate Cognitive Architecture
  • 3.5 Choice
  • 3.6 Other Contenders
  • 3.7 Frameworks Revisited
• 4. Arguments for Relativism
  • 4.1 Perception is Theory-Laden
  • 4.2 Alternative Frameworks are Incommensurable
  • 4.3 Normative Relativism as the Best Explanation [Not yet available]
  • 4.4 Normative Relativism and the Nature of Justification [Not yet available]
  • 4.5 The Master Argument for Normative Relativism [Not yet available]
• 5. Arguments against Relativism
  • 5.1 No Facts of the Matter
  • 5.2 Perception is not Hopelessly Theory-Laden
  • 5.3 Cognitive Architecture and Cognitive Universals
  • 5.4 Semantic Realism
  • 5.5 The Mediation Problem: Concepts aren't Veils
  • 5.6 Going off the Deep End: Extrapolation into Unintelligibility?
  • 5.7 Transcendental Arguments
  • 5.8 Understanding and Charitable Construal
  • 5.9 Self-Refutation: Quicksand all the Way Down
  • 5.10 “Beyond Relativism”
• Bibliography
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

Most Detailed Table of Contents (to Subsubsection-Level)

• 1. A Framework for Relativism
  • 1.1 Y is relative to X
  • 1.2 Descriptive Relativism and Normative Relativism
  • 1.3 The Two Faces of Normative Relativism
  • 1.4 Relativism as Presupposing Realism and Inconceivable without It
  • 1.5 A Taxonomy of Positions
  • 1.6 Matters of Degree
    • 1.6.1 Large vs. Small Differences
    • 1.6.2 Local vs. Global Relativisms
  • 1.7 Exceptions and Dispensations: The Exemption Problem
• 2. Dependent Variables: What is Relative?
  • 2.1 Central Concepts
    • 2.1.1 Concepts do More than Classify
    • 2.1.2 Expressibility vs. Usability
  • 2.2 Central Beliefs
  • 2.3 Perception
  • 2.4 Epistemic Appraisal
    • 2.4.1 Epistemic Relativism
  • 2.5 Ethics
  • 2.6 Semantics
    • 2.6.1 Meaning Holism and the Relativity of Meaning
  • 2.7 Practice
  • 2.8 Truth
  • 2.9 Reality
  • 2.10 Relationships among the Kinds of Relativism
• 3. Independent Variables: Relative to What?
  • Relativism as Social
  • 3.1 Language
  • 3.2 Culture
  • 3.3 Historical Period
  • 3.4 Innate Cognitive Architecture
  • 3.5 Choice
  • 3.6 Other Contenders
    • 3.6.1 Scientific Frameworks
    • 3.6.2 Religion
    • 3.6.3 Gender, Race, and Social Status
    • 3.6.4 The Individual
  • 3.7 Frameworks Revisited
• 4. Arguments for Relativism
  • 4.1 Perception is Theory-Laden
  • 4.2 Alternative Frameworks are Incommensurable
  • 4.3 Normative Relativism as the Best Explanation [Not yet available]
  • 4.4 Normative Relativism and the Nature of Justification [Not yet available]
  • 4.5 The Master Argument for Normative Relativism [Not yet available]
• 5. Arguments against Relativism
  • 5.1 No Facts of the Matter
  • 5.2 Perception is not Hopelessly Theory-Laden
  • 5.3 Cognitive Architecture and Cognitive Universals
    • Normative Mileage from Factual Consensus?
  • 5.4 Semantic Realism
    • 5.4.1 Reference and Relativism
    • 5.4.2 Semantic Externalism and Relativism
    • 5.4.3 Platonism and Relativism
  • 5.5 The Mediation Problem: Concepts aren't Veils
  • 5.6 Going off the Deep End: Extrapolation into Unintelligibility?
    • 5.6.1 Live Options
  • 5.7 Transcendental Arguments
    • 5.7.1 Two Types of Retrenchment
  • 5.8 Understanding and Charitable Construal
  • 5.9 Self-Refutation: Quicksand all the Way Down
    • 5.9.1 Complete Metastasis
    • 5.9.2 Damage Control
  • 5.10 “Beyond Relativism”
    • Not Just Anything Goes
    • Rational Change Does Occur
    • Reconciling Rationality and Contingency
    • 5.10.1 A Residual Sense of Contingency?
• Bibliography
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

Table of Contents to Relativism
Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy