Two Simple Proofs in Kd

First consider the very simple proof of OBd:

By PC, we have d → d as a theorem. Then by R2, it follows that □(d → d), that is, OBd.

Next consider a proof of NC, OBp → ~OB~p. As usual, in proofs of wffs with deontic operators, we make free use of the rules and theorems that carry over from the normal modal logic K. Here it is more perspicuous to lay the proof out in a numbered-lined stack:

1. Assume ~(OBp → ~OB~p).	(For reductio)
2. That is, assume ~(□(d → p) → ~□(d → ~p))	(Def of “OB”)
3. So □(d → p) & □(d → ~p).	(2, by PC)
4. So □(d → (p & ~p)).	(3, derived rule of modal logic, K)
5. But ◊d	(A3)
6. So ◊(p & ~p).	(4 and 5, derived rule of modal logic, K)
7. But ~◊(p & ~p).	(a theorem of modal logic, K)
8. So OBp → ~OB~p	(1-7, PC)

Return to Deontic Logic.