Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Notes to Gertrude Elizabeth Margaret Anscombe

1. It should be noted that this view of speech acts as lacking representational content has been challenged.

2. Note that this reading of the article is at odds with that of Mary Geach, who maintained in a letter to the Times Literary Supplement, in response to Simon Blackburn's 30 September 2005 review of Human Life, that her mother was “…proposing, in an atheistic culture, a study of the psychology of the virtues with a view to finding a clear and non-theistic method by which one could come to see the objective truths of morality.” This view, though, doesn't seem well supported by Anscombe's clearly expressed doubts about developing a normative account of human flourishing that was naturalistic, and that would stand up to scrutiny.