Notes to Arabic and Islamic Philosophy of Language and Logic
1. There are other overviews of the subject. Highly recommended are: Arnaldez (1960-), good for the interrelation of logic with the Islamic sciences; Black (1998), good for an overview of philosophical issues specific to Arabic logic; Gutas (1993), excellent on genres, basic bibliography and outline history; Rescher (1964), indispensable, with an outline history and biobibliograhical details of major logicians throughout the tradition.
2. The translation movement is a complex phenomenon, and no attempt to deal with its motivations or changing emphases will be made here. For a preliminary account, see Gutas (1960-2004); for a much more detailed account, see Gutas (1998).
3. For background to this and the following three paragraphs, see Peters (1968) 7-30 and Hugonnard-Roche (1989-2003e) and subsequent articles in Goulet (1989-2003).
4. For an idea of the translation-complexes that resulted from these translation practices, see (specifically on the Prior-Analytics complex) Lameer (1994) chapter 1.
5. Translation from Abed (1991) xvi (minor changes made). A translation of the entire debate is given in Margoliouth (1905).
6. Those who consider it important include Elamrani-Jamal (1983) (with French translation); Endress (1986) (with German translation); Mahdi (1970) (an idiosyncratic appraisal). Those who take it to be relatively insignificant include Frank; see his review of Endress in Frank (1991) (I agree with Frank).
7. Alfarabi (1986) 68.11-12; cf. Sabra (1965) 242a. For an analysis of the juristic arguments that were reduced to syllogisms, see Lameer (1994) chapters 6, 7 & 8.
8. Cf. Zimmermann (1981), Dânishpazhûh (1989). For a philosophical appraisal of one short passage, see Thom (2008a).
9. There are two editions of the Arabic Organon: Badawî (1948/52) and Jabre (1999). For remarks on the nature of the glosses, see Hugonnard-Roche (1993); see also the review of this article: Lameer (1996).
10. See the account of the attempts of ‘Abdallatif al-Bagdâdî (d. 1231) to learn Alfarabi's logic in Stern (1962).
11. “Intuition” (hads) is a technical term in Avicenna's philosophy; for an extended treatment, see Gutas (1988) especially 197-198.
12. See Gutas (1988) for an account and chronology of Avicenna's major works, especially 101ff. (Cure) and 140ff. (Pointers).
13. See Sâwî (1898); he politely corrects “the most eminent of the later scholars” (afdal al-muta'akhkhirîn) on matters of syllogistic: correcting aspects of Avicenna's account of contradiction 68.14f.; of conversion 76.3f.; of mixed modals 91.10f.
14. For a preliminary analysis, see Street (2005). Important publications not consulted for that study include Râzî (1996) and Râzî (1381 A. H.).
15. Khaled El-Rouayheb is in the process of editing Khûnajî's major work on logic, Kashf al-Asrâr, and has kindly given me extracts from that work, and a deal of information on Khûnajî's scholarly connexions.
16. Translated in El-Rouayheb (2004) 227 (I have changed the spelling slightly to fit in with the rest of this entry).
17. El-Rouayheb (2005) makes a promising beginning in the ocean of material. See also Walbridge (2000) and Walbridge (2003).
18. Toulawy (2001) is part of a larger project which will hopefully bring these texts to scholarly light.
19. Alfarabi (1931) 12.5-8; translated in Black (1998) (minor changes made).
20. Alfarabi (1931) 17.5-7, 18.4-7; first paragraph translated in Black (1998).
21. Translated and analysed in Sabra (1980) 752; translating Avicenna (1952) 15.9-17 (minor differences from Sabra's translation).
22. Avicenna (2005) 7; translated in Sabra (1980) 753, and in Bertolacci (2006) 273.
23. From Avicenna (1952) 23.5-6, 24.3-4, translated in Black (1991) 54; see also Sabra (1980) 762.
24. Avicenna (1952) 22:14-23:8; partly translated in Sabra (1980) 763, partly in Black (1991) 54-55 (minor changes made).
25. A major new study has come out on this doublet: Lameer (2006).
26. Avicenna (1952) 17.7-17, translated in Sabra (1980) 760 (minor changes).
27. Berlin ms. Ldbg. 1035, f.8 left column line pu to f.9 right column line 8.
28. Khaled El-Rouayheb has kindly sent me Khûnajî's arguments in Kashf al-Asrâr, and they do not clarify the issues.
29. Black (1990) 247-258 (on whom I draw) for an assessment of the philosophical implications of the context theory.
30. Translated in Miller (1984) 200 (minor changes made; my manuscript differs slightly from his); see Berlin ms. Ldbg. 1035, f.141 right column lines 40-45.
31. Thom (2008b); note that Thom (2003) chapter 4 is an exploration of the de re ampliationist interpretation.
32. I adopt the symbolism from Smith (1989) Appendix I.
33. Averroes (1983) 161.11-163.6; translated from the Latin in Thom (2003) 81-82 (minor changes made).
34. See the essay on conversion in Averroes (1983) 100-105.
35. Smyth (1993), especially 110; the analysis is actually Sakkâkî's rather than Qazwînî's.