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Beardsley's Aesthetics

First published Tue Sep 13, 2005

Monroe Beardsley (1915-1985) was born and raised in Bridgeport, Connecticut, and educated at Yale University (B.A. 1936, Ph.D. 1939). He taught at a number of colleges and universities, including Mt. Holyoke College and Yale University, but most of his career was spent at Swarthmore College (22 years) and Temple University (16 years).

Beardsley is best known for his work in aesthetics—and this article will deal exclusively with his work in that area—but he was an extremely intellectually curious man, and published articles in a number of areas, including the philosophy of history, action theory, and the history of modern philosophy.

Three books and a number of articles form the core of Beardsley's work in aesthetics. Of the books, the first, Aesthetics: Problems in the Philosophy of Criticism (1958; reissued with a postscript, 1981), is by far the most substantial, comprehensive, and influential. More than that, it's also the first systematic, well-argued, and critically informed philosophy of art in the analytic tradition. Given the wide range of topics covered in Aesthetics, the intelligent and philosophically informed treatment accorded them, the historically unprecedented nature of the work, and its effect on subsequent developments in the field, a number of philosophers, including some of Beardsley's critics, have argued that Aesthetics is the most impressive and important book of 20th century analytic aesthetics.

The Possibility of Criticism, the second of the three books, is more modest in scope and less groundbreaking. Exclusively concerned with literary criticism, it limits itself to four problems: the ‘self-sufficiency’ of a literary text, the nature of literary interpretation, judging literary texts, and bad poetry.

The last of the books, The Aesthetic Point of View, is a collection of papers, most old, some new. Fourteen papers, largely on the nature of the aesthetic and art criticism, are reprinted, and six new pieces are added. The new pieces are of special interest, because they constitute Beardsley's final word on the topics covered, and the topics are themselves central ones: aesthetic experience, the definition of art, judgments of value, reasons in art criticism, artists' intentions and interpretation, and art and culture.

1. Background

In Aesthetics, Beardsley develops a philosophy of art that is sensitive to three things: (i) art itself and people's pre-philosophical interest in and opinions about art, (ii) critics' pronouncements about art, and (iii) developments in philosophy, especially, though not exclusively, those in the analytic tradition. To explain each of these elements further: (i) In the late 1940s and early 1950s, the time at which Beardsley developed his philosophy of art, there were developments in the arts—new forms in music, painting, and literature had appeared and were appearing—but there was also a well established and relatively large canon of works almost universally regarded as aesthetically superior and worthy of attention. (ii) Art criticism had become an industry, with major schools of all sorts flourishing: Marxist, Formalist, psychoanalytic, semiotic, historical, biographical. (iii) And philosophy had changed in rapid and unexpected ways. Analytic philosophy, with its emphasis on language and strong empiricist tendencies, had gained ascendancy in American universities in little more than 20 years, and dominated the philosophical scene.

Beardsley responded to each of the three. His position on developments in the arts is probably best described as open-minded moderation. He welcomed new developments, and reference to new works and works that lack the luster of fame, notoriety, or ready recognition appear frequently in Aesthetics and his other work. He didn't automatically embrace the latest fad, fashion, or movement, however, but tried, as he said, to get something out of a work.

As for art criticism, the school of criticism that attracted Beardsley, and that his philosophy of art ultimately underwrites, is the so-called New Criticism. The New Criticism made the literary work the center of critical attention, and denied, or at least greatly devaluated, the relevance of facts about the origin of literary works, their effects upon individual readers, and their personal, social, and political influence. Close reading is what is required of a critic, not biographical information about the author, a rundown of the state of society at the time the work was written, data about the psychology of creation, predictions about the effects of the work on society, and certainly not a piece of autobiography detailing the critic's own personal response to the work. Though based in literary criticism, the New Criticism could be, and should be, extended to the other arts, Beardsley thought: all art criticism should make a serious effort to recognize its objects as special, autonomous, and important in their own right, and not subservient to ulterior aims or values; all art criticism should attempt to understand how works of art work, and what meanings and aesthetic properties they have; all art criticism should strive for objective and publicly accessible methods and standards to test its pronouncements.

Developments in philosophy were a different story. Beardsley embraced a general form of analytic philosophy not heavily influenced by either logical positivism or ordinary language philosophy, the dominant movements of the time. For him, an analytic approach to the philosophy of art meant no more than critically examining the fundamental concepts and beliefs underlying art and art criticism. Doing philosophy of that sort required clarity, precision, and a good eye for identifying, exposing, and evaluating arguments, but left aesthetics, as a systematic study, a real possibility.

2. The Nature of Aesthetics

Not all the arts could be covered in detail in even so long a book as Aesthetics—it's over 600 pages—so Beardsley had to content himself with concentrating on three relatively disparate arts: literature, music, and painting. In keeping with the conception of philosophy mentioned above, aesthetics was thought of as meta-criticism. "There would be no problems of aesthetics," Beardsley says, "if no one ever talked about works of art…. We can't do aesthetics until we have some critical statements to work on" (pp. 1,4). Aesthetics is concerned with "the nature and basis of criticism, … just as criticism itself is concerned with works of art" (p. 6). The then-current and still widespread view that philosophy is a second-order, meta-level, and essentially linguistic activity, taking as its object of study the pronouncements of first-order activities, such as chemistry, religion, or history, is reflected in Beardsley's view on the nature of aesthetics.

Critical statements are of three kinds, Beardsley thinks: descriptive, interpretative, and evaluative. The first concerns non-normative properties of works of art that are simply in it, in some sense, and are available, at least in principle, to anyone of normal eyes and ears if sufficiently sensitive, attentive, and experienced. ‘There is a small red patch in the upper right-hand corner of the painting’ is a descriptive statement, but so is ‘Haydn's 23rd Symphony abounds in dynamic tension.’ The philosophical problems that descriptive statements give rise to involve the concept of form, Beardsley thinks. Interpretative statements are also non-normative, but concern the ‘meaning’ of a work of art, with ‘meaning’ here referring to a semantic relation, or at least a purported semantic relation, between the work and something outside it. ‘That's a picture of Notary Sojac’ is an interpretative statement, as are ‘That's a picture of a unicorn,’ ‘The passage refers to Brutus's betrayal of Caesar,’ and ‘The thesis of Macbeth is exceedingly simple: Thou shalt not kill.’ Last, critical evaluations are normative judgments that basically say that a work of art is good or bad, or how good or bad it is. ‘Mozart's Turkish March is an excellent short piano piece’ is a critical evaluation, and so is ‘The Face on the Barroom Floor is wretched verse.’ The judgment ‘This is beautiful’—the paradigm of a judgment of taste, according to Kant—is sometimes thought of as a critical evaluation (p. 9), but more often (e.g., pp. 463, 507), and always in Beardsley's later writing, as a descriptive judgment, and one that frequently forms at least a partial basis for a critical evaluation.

3. The Ontology of Art

The first chapter of Aesthetics is in part devoted to the ontology of art—or aesthetic objects, as Beardsley was then wont to say. The term ‘work of art’ was largely avoided by him at the time, because, as he later admitted, he did "not [want] to become enmeshed … in [the question of the definition of ‘work of art,’ a question] that … [had] not convince[d] [him] of its importance or promise[d] any very satisfactory and agreeable resolution" (p. xviii).

The ontology argued for begins with a distinction between physical objects and perceptual objects. In speaking of a thing being six feet by six feet in size and at rest, we're speaking of a physical object; in speaking of a thing being dynamic and frightening, we're speaking of a perceptual object. Perceptual objects are the objects we perceive, objects "some of whose qualities, at least, are open to direct sensory awareness" (p. 31). Aesthetic objects are a subset of perceptual objects. This doesn't necessarily mean that aesthetic objects aren't physical objects, however. Aesthetic objects might be other than physical objects—the conceptual distinction might mark a real distinction—or they might be physical objects—the conceptual distinction, though somewhat misleadingly couched in terms of objects, might simply mark "two aspects of the same" thing (p. 33). At first indifferent as to which alternative is opted for—Beardsley mentions that he doesn't "see that it makes much difference which terminology [that of objects or aspects] is chosen" (p. 33)—he then proceeds to develop an ontology that stresses objects more than aspects.

The ontology is phenomenalistic in its leanings, though open to a more physicalistic interpretation. A presentation of an aesthetic object is defined as the object as experienced by a particular person on a particular occasion. Essentially, presentations are sense-data of aesthetic objects. Aesthetic objects aren't presentations, however, for that would invite not just an uncontrollable population explosion of aesthetic objects, but chaos in criticism; and neither are aesthetic objects classes of presentations, for aesthetic objects must have at least some perceptual properties, but classes, as abstract entities, have none. However, "whenever we want to say anything about an aesthetic object, we can talk about its presentations" (p. 54). This, Beardsley says, "does not ‘reduce’ the aesthetic object to a presentation; it only analyzes statements about aesthetic objects into statements about presentations" (p. 54). In effect, this is a form of linguistic phenomenalism, and commits Beardsley to meaning-preserving translations of statements about aesthetic objects into statements about the presentations of such objects—in effect, statements about experiences of such objects.

Not satisfied with this, Beardsley presses on to distinguish (a) the artifact—the play itself, say, as written down—from (b) a particular production of it—the Old Vic's production, as opposed to the Marquette University theater department's production—from (c) a particular performance of it—last night's performance in the Haelfer Theater—from (d) a particular presentation of it—the play as it shows up in Peter Alelyunas's experience of it, upon attending last night's performance. The same distinctions hold across the arts, though differently in different arts, and somewhat more naturally in some than others. There is Beethoven's D Minor Symphony (the artifact), a production of it (The Philadelphia Symphony Orchestra's recording of it), a particular performance of it (my playing the recording last night, in my house), and particular presentations of it (mine and other people's experiences of it last night, in my house). At least in many arts, a single artifact can have many productions; a single production can have many performances; and a single performance can give rise to many presentations. As Beardsley notes, these distinctions collapse to some extent in some of the arts, and would have to be stretched a bit to fit them all. In reading a poem silently, he says, the production is the presentation (and I would also think the performance); "in architecture, the architect's plans are the artifact; the completed building is the production" (pp. 57-58) (and also presumably the performance); and in painting and sculpture, "the distinction between artifact and production almost disappears" (p. 58) (with the performance presumably being identical with both).

But what is the aesthetic object, the object of critical attention? It's not a presentation or class of presentations, and it's not the artifact—Beethoven's 9th Symphony, for example. If the aesthetic object were the artifact, it would have contradictory characteristics, since different recordings of the 9th have different, incompatible characteristics: some are shorter than 60 minutes, some longer. What's left, and what the aesthetic object must be, is the production. Thus the primary object of critical attention is the production of an artifact, and the basic job of the critic is to describe, interpret, and evaluate such productions.

Although Beardsley's early views on ontology tended to either linguistic phenomenalism or unsystematic pluralism—some productions are physical objects, some mental objects, and some physical events—there were hints, event at that time, of a simpler and more commonsensical view. The ontology can be seen lurking beneath the surface of his postulates of art criticism:

  1. The aesthetic object is a perceptual object; that is, it can have presentations.
  2. Presentations of the same aesthetic object may occur at different times and to different people.
  3. Two presentations of the same aesthetic object may differ from each other.
  4. The characteristics of an aesthetic object may not be exhaustively revealed in any particular presentation of it.
  5. A presentation may be veridical; that is, the characteristics of the presentation may correspond to the characteristics of the aesthetic object.
  6. A presentation may be illusory; that is, some of the characteristics of the presentation may fail to correspond to the characteristics of the aesthetic object.
  7. If two presentations of the same aesthetic object have incompatible characteristics, at least one of them is illusory (pp. 46, 48).

Taking ‘aesthetic object’ to mean ‘work of art,’ the underlying ontology isn't a sense-datum ontology or a mixed-category ontology at all. A number of the postulates—2, 4, and 6; possibly 3 and 7—are in fact prima facie incompatible with a sense-datum ontology. Rather, what 1-7 strongly suggest is that a work of art is a physical object: it's perceptible, publicly or inter-subjectively available in both time and space, can appear differently from different points of view and at different times, may not be exhaustively understood on any given occasion, has properties that may be correctly or incorrectly perceived, and is such that attributions to it obey the law of the excluded middle.

Not surprisingly, after 1958 Beardsley "moved steadily in the direction of some form of non-reductive materialism, of seeing how far it is possible to go in treating artworks as physical objects" (Aesthetics, p. xxiv). The materialism is non-reductive, in that works of art have properties that physical objects generally don't. Such materialism works well with "singular" works of art, such as paintings, Beardsley thinks, but "multiple artworks"—musical compositions which have many performances, poems which exist in multiple printings—present problems. The musical composition isn't any single score or performance, the poem any single printed text. For that reason, Beardsley once again is driven back in the direction of ontological pluralism: perhaps works of art are either physical objects (the singular works) or kinds of physical object (the multiple works), with "physical object" construed broadly here so as to include events (such as a dance).

4. The Definition of Art

As mentioned above, Beardsley "sedulously avoided" (p. 59) the term ‘work of art’ as much as possible in Aesthetics. He later did offer a definition, however, and, somewhat surprisingly, a neo-Romantic and intentionalistic one. A work of art, he says, is "either an arrangement of conditions intended to be capable of affording an experience with marked aesthetic character or (incidentally) an arrangement belonging to a class or type of arrangements that is typically intended to have this capacity" (The Aesthetic Point of View, p. 299). The first disjunct is the more important one; it says that something's a work if it's an artifact, "an arrangement of conditions," that was intended by its creator to be capable of providing an experience with non-negligible aesthetic character. This definition doesn't say that a work of art is intended to provide (or be capable of providing) a full-blown aesthetic experience. Only "an experience with marked aesthetic character" is required. It also doesn't say that a work of art doesn't or can't have a utilitarian function, in the everyday sense of the term. A work of art could be a chair that's many times simply sat in, for example. And, last, it doesn't say that the primary intention behind the creation of the artifact is an aesthetic one. The primary intention behind the creation of a religious icon, for example, could be to bring worshippers closer to God.

The second part of the definition picks up those objects that definitely are works of art, but were created in a mechanical, almost an assembly-line fashion, or as just another instance of its kind. Some beautiful vases may fall into the first class, and many medieval icons into the second. To make sure that the extension of the definiens matches that of the definiendum, Beardsley thinks, the second disjunct of the definition is needed.

But why accept the definition? For a number of reasons, according to Beardsley. First, a definition "chosen for a role in aesthetic theory should mark a distinction that is … significant for aesthetic theory (p. 299), and Beardsley's does. Second, "in selecting key terms for aesthetic theory we ought to stay as close as convenient to ordinary use" (p. 300). Not everyone's use of a term needs to be captured in fashioning a definition, which would be impossible in any case with a term as elastic and tendentiously used as ‘work of art.’ Beardsley's definition has the merit of capturing "reasonably well a use that has been prominent for some centuries and still persists quite widely today, outside the speech and writing of or about the avant-garde" (p. 300). Third, a definition of ‘work of art’ "should be of the greatest possible utility to inquirers in other fields besides aesthetics—fields to which aesthetics itself should (sometimes) be thought of as a support and underpinning" (p. 304). The fields Beardsley has in mind, more than any other, are art history and anthropology. Fourth and last, a definition of ‘work of art’ should "conceptually link … art and the aesthetic" (p. 312). That Beardsley's does in spades, directly defining art in terms of the aesthetic as it does.

5. The Intentions of the Artist

Despite his many books and articles, Beardsley is probably best known for his very first article in aesthetics. In "The Intentional Fallacy," a paper co-written with William K. Wimsatt and published in 1946 (and widely re-printed, e.g., in Joseph Margolis, ed., Philosophy Looks at the Arts, 3rd edition, 1987), he argued against the neo-Romantic view that a work of art means what the artist says it means, or what he intends it to mean. More precisely, the issue can put in terms of the relation between

  1. The artist intended x to mean p in work w

and

  1. x means p in work w.

According to E.D. Hirsch, (1) entails (2), at least if w is a literary work, because the meaning of ‘x’ simply is what the writer meant or intended by ‘x.’ Knowing the artist's intention is thus knowing the work's meaning. That's one end of the spectrum on the relation between (1) and (2).

Beardsley sits at the other end. He holds that the intentions of the artist aren't relevant to the interpretation of a work of art at all. (1) not only doesn't entail (2); in and of itself, it provides no direct evidential support for (2). An artist's intentions have nothing to do with what a work means.

Beardsley was in fact more than consistent on the issue of the intentional fallacy; he also held that

  1. The artist intended w to have descriptive property p

provides no direct evidential support for

  1. W has descriptive property p,

and that

  1. The artist intended w to have evaluative property e

provides no direct evidential support for

  1. W has evaluative property e.

An artist's intentions are utterly irrelevant to the descriptive, interpretive, and evaluative properties of his work.

And in addition to "The Intentional Fallacy," there's also "The Affective Fallacy." In a paper bearing that name, and also co-written with William Wimsatt, Beardsley argues that a person's affective responses to a work of art are irrelevant to its descriptive, interpretive, and evaluative properties.

Beardsley's arguments against intentionalism in interpretation are of a variety of sorts. In "The Intentional Fallacy," he says that the intentions of the artist are neither "available nor desirable" (p. 367), with this meaning that such intentions aren't always available and are never desirable. Since we frequently can and do correctly interpret a work of art with little or no knowledge about the artist, the fact that the artist's intentions aren't always available is enough to show that Hirsch's position is wrong.

"Judging a poem is like judging a pudding or a machine," according to Beardsley. "One demands that it work. It is only because an artifact works that we infer the intention of the artificer …. A poem can be only through its meaning … yet it is, simply is, in the sense that we have no excuse for inquiring what part is intended or meant" (p. 368). In other words, a poem or other work of art is independent of its creator, just as any other artifact—a pudding or a washing machine—is. A pudding consists of milk, eggs, and other ingredients, a washing machine of a metal drum, rubber gaskets, and other parts, and a poem of words. In all three cases, the parts exist and are what they are independently of the artificers, and the artifacts are to be judged—and interpreted—on the basis of their properties. There's no need to bring in the artificer.

In Aesthetics, the attack is a little different. "We must distinguish between the aesthetic object and the intention in the mind of its creator," Beardsley says, and the irrelevance of the latter to interpretation can be shown if we consider a certain sculpture, "a large, twisted, cruller-shaped object of polished teak, mounted at an oblique angle to the floor." The creator of the sculpture intends it to "symbolize … Human Destiny." Try as we might, however, we "see in it no such symbolic meaning." The philosophical question then is, "Should we say that we have simply missed the symbolism, but that it must be there, since what a statue symbolizes is precisely what its maker makes it symbolize? Or should we say, in the spirit of Alice confronting the extreme semantic conventionalism [intentionalism] of Humpty Dumpty, that the question is whether that object can be made to mean Human Destiny?" Obviously the latter, Beardsley thinks, for the former entails that "anyone can make anything symbolize anything just by saying it does, for another sculptor could copy the same object and label it ‘Spirit of Palm Beach, 1938’" (Aesthetics, pp. 18-19, 21).

In addition to sculpture, the irrelevance of the author to the meaning of his text is also argued for by Beardsley, though only partly by counterexample. "Suppose someone utters a sentence," he says. "We can [then] ask two questions: (1) What does the speaker mean? (2) What does the sentence mean?" Although answers to the two questions usually coincide, they can diverge; people can mean one thing and say another. The reason that's possible is that "what a sentence means depends not on the whim of the individual, and his mental vagaries, but upon public conventions of usage that are tied up with habit patterns in the whole speaking community." Sentence meaning—that is, textual meaning—is thus one thing, and is anchored in "the whole speaking community," while speaker meaning—what the author meant—is quite another, and is anchored in his own, quite possibly idiosyncratic intentions. Thus an author can be wrong about what his own work means. A.E. Housman, for example, was probably wrong in claiming that his poem "1887" wasn't ironic (pp. 25-26).

In The Possibility of Criticism, three arguments are offered against intentionalism, which is again taken to be the view that the meaning of a work of art is what the artist intends it to mean. The first is that "some texts that have been formed without the agency of an author, and hence without authorial meaning, nevertheless have a meaning and can be interpreted" (p. 18). What Beardsley has in mind is the kind of verbal mistake made at a publishing house, or by a computer in scanning a document. He cites the sentence "Jensen argued like a man filled with righteous indigestion" as an example of a text that can be read and interpreted, yet no agency, a fortiori no author's intention, stands behind it. "Indignation" became "indigestion" at the printer's, by mechanical error.

The second argument is that "the meaning of a text can change after its author has died. But the author cannot change his meaning after he has died. Therefore, textual meaning is not identical to the authorial meaning." Bolstering this argument is the fact that "the OED furnishes abundant evidence that individual words and idioms acquire new meanings and lose old meanings as time passes; these changes can in turn produce changes of the meaning in sentences in which the words appear." As an example, Beardsley cites a line from a poem written in 1744, "He raised his plastic arm," and notes that "plastic arm" has "acquired a new meaning in the twentieth century." Thus the line "in which it occurs has also acquired a new meaning" (p. 19).

The third argument is the familiar one that "a text can have meanings that its author is not aware of. Therefore, it can have meanings that its author did not intend. Therefore, textual meaning is not identical to authorial meaning" (p. 20).

More than this, what's really needed to decide whether there's an intentional fallacy is a theory of meaning. A theory of meaning is a theory of what it is for w (some object, in the broad sense of the term) to mean p. Beardsley was always aware of the need for a theory of meaning, and in Aesthetics he proposed one, a complicated theory which he later rejected. A few years later, however, he embraced a speech-act theory based on the work of William Alston, and used it to defend the intentional fallacy in his final paper on the topic.

Alston believes that the meaning of a sentence is the sentence's speech act potential, its potential for performing all of the various speech acts it can be used to perform. In effect, this is to take the slogan "Meaning is use" very seriously, and to cash in "use" in terms of the performance of speech acts. Sentence meaning is primary on this theory, and word meaning secondary and derivative, since it's defined in terms of a word's contribution to the speech act potential of the sentences into which it can figure. Beardsley thought this theory correct and used it to argue that the intentional fallacy is indeed a fallacy.

In "Intentions and Interpretations" (The Aesthetic Point of View), he claims that in composing a poem the poet doesn't perform a speech act, but rather represents the performance of a speech act or acts. When Wordsworth writes,

Milton! Thous shouldst be living at this hour:

England hath need of thee—

his words are ostensibly addressed to a long-dead poet, but to perform an illocutionary, any illocutionary action, a person must believe that he can or will "secure uptake," that is, secure understanding of his sentence and the speech act performed. Wordsworth, however, knew that Milton was long dead, and had no such belief. He thus didn't perform the illocutionary act of addressing Milton, or stating that England needs him. He does represent the performance of those illocutionary acts, though. What poets and other authors of literary works do, Beardsley thinks, is represent the performance of illocutionary acts, not perform illocutionary acts themselves.

Beardsley's complete argument is basically:

  1. The meaning of a sentence ‘S’ is its total illocutionary act potential, that is, its capacity to perform the speech acts, I, J, and K.
  2. The performance of speech acts I, J, K in using ‘S’ does not require the corresponding intentions to perform speech acts I, J, and K in using ‘S.’
  3. Thus, the meaning of ‘S’ is independent of the intentions of the speaker to perform the speech acts that constitute, as potentially performable acts, the meaning of ‘S.’
  4. Differently put, the meaning of ‘S’ is logically independent of the speaker's intention to mean what ‘S’ does in fact mean.
  5. Therefore, a speaker's intention that sentence ‘S’ mean p is logically irrelevant to whether it does mean p.
  6. But even if (4) were false, and the meaning, M, of a non-literary sentence—a sentence not in a work of literature—were partly a function of the speaker's intention that it mean M, the same wouldn't be true of a literary sentence.

The proof of (6) is that

  1. An author does not perform illocutionary acts, I, J, and K in uttering (writing, dictating, signing, etc.) ‘S.’
  2. Rather, he represents the performance of illocutionary acts I, J, and K in uttering ‘S.’
  3. Representing an illocutionary act involves renouncing, withholding, or suspending the performance of that act.
  4. Thus, representing the performance of I, J, and K doesn't require the intention to perform I, J, and K.
  5. Consequently, even if (4) were false as far as non-literary sentences were concerned, it would be true as far as literary sentences were concerned, for the meaning of ‘S’ is logically independent of the speaker's intention to mean what ‘S’ in fact does mean.

6. The Internal and the External

Broader than concerns about the relevance of the artist's intention and encompassing them is the distinction between external and internal evidence. "Internal evidence," Beardsley says, "is evidence from direct inspection of the object" (Aesthetics, p. 20). What is internal is publicly accessible; "it is discovered [in the case of poetry] through the semantics and syntax of a poem, though our habitual knowledge of the language through grammars, dictionaries, and all the literature which is the source of dictionaries, in general through all that makes a language and culture" ("The Intentional Fallacy," p. 373). "External evidence," on the other hand, "is evidence from the psychological and social background of the object, from which we may infer something about the object itself" (Aesthetics, p. 20). What is external is not publicly accessible; it is "private or idiosyncratic; not [again in the case of poetry] a part of the work as a linguistic fact: it consists of revelations (in journals, for example, or letters or recorded conversations) about how or why the poet wrote the poem—to what lady, while sitting on what lawn, or at the death of a friend or brother" ("The Intentional Fallacy," p. 373). In addition to internal and external evidence, there is "an intermediate kind of evidence about the character of the author or about private or semi-private meanings attached to words or topics by the author or by a coterie of which he is a member" ("The Intentional Fallacy," p. 373). External evidence is verboten in criticism, Beardsley thinks, but at least at the time of "The Intentional Fallacy," intermediate evidence was admissible, the reason being that "the meaning of words is the history of words, and the biography of an author, his use of a word, and the associations the word had for him, are part of the word's history and meaning" ("The Intentional Fallacy," p. 373). Caution has to be exercised, though, for the line between intermediate evidence and external evidence isn't sharp, and "a critic who is concerned with [internal] evidence … and moderately with [intermediate] evidence will in the long run produce a different sort of comment from that of the critic who is concerned with [external] evidence and with [intermediate] evidence" ("The Intentional Fallacy," p. 373). Intermediate evidence is never mentioned in Aesthetics or in any of Beardsley's subsequent writings, however, and the category seems to have been subsumed under "external evidence." The result is an even sharper line between what is and isn't admissible evidence in criticism.

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art, definition of | culture | intention | meaning, theories of | music, philosophy of | ontological commitment | speech acts | types and tokens