Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Supplement to Category Theory

Programmatic Reading Guide

The following Guide has been divided into sections to facilitate programmatic reading.

A. General books on category theory

A.1 Introductory texts

The following two texts are intended for undergraduates or nonspecialists.

A.2 Intermediate texts

The following classic textbook includes much more than category theory, but it contains the rudiments of the theory with applications.

The following books provide an accessible approach to category theory and categorical logic:

The standard reference on category theory is unquestionably:

A.3 Other interesting and useful books

B. Books and articles on higher-dimensional category theory

C. Books and articles with a philosophical bent

C.1 Category theory and the philosophy of mathematics

C.2 Category theory and set theory

C.3 Categorical foundations of logic and mathematics

C.4 Applications of category theory to philosophical and cognitive issues

D. Books and papers on categorical logic

D.1 Introductory books and papers

One of the first introductory books on the subject is and still extremely useful for readers without a strong background in category theory:

For readers with a background in logic and set theory:

D.2 Advanced textbooks

Note that the second volume of (Johnstone 2002a) contains a clear and exhaustive presentation of categorical logic in a topos theoretical setting.

D.3 Research monographs

D.4 Books and introductory papers written for computer scientists

D.5 A book on nonclassical logics from a categorical point of view

D.6 Research papers on various aspects of categorical logic

D.6.1 Completeness results
D.6.2 Categorical logic and constructivism
D.6.3 Applications of categorical logic to set theory
D.6.4 Proof theory
D.6.5 Modal logic and other logical systems

E. Applications of category theory

E.1 Books and papers on synthetic differential geometry

E.2 Other applications of category theory

F. Major books and papers of the history of category theory

F.1 The first period: the origins and first applications 1942-1957

F.2 The second period: the emergence of an autonomous field 1957-1970

F.3 The birth of categorical logic

F.4 On the history of category theory and categorical logic