Supplement to Death
The Argument: Death and Posthumous Events Don't Affect Us
Here is a more explicit version of 1-13 (with thanks to Curtis Brown):
Let s,s′, … range over subjects; v,v′, … over events and states; and t,t′, … over times. We can use the following abbreviations:
SD(v,s,t): v is the state of s being dead at t harm2(v,s): v harms s harm3(v,s,t): v harms s at t t > t’: t is after t’ t ≥ t’: t is after t’ or t = t’
We can use the following function symbols:
For any subject s, ED(s) is the event of s’s death
For any event or state v, T(v) is the time v occurs or holds
Next come axioms:
A1: ∀v∀s(harm2(v,s) iff ∃tharm3(v,s,t)) A2: ∀v∀s(v is posthumous for s iff T(v) > T(ED(s))) A3: ∀v∀s∀t(If SD(v,s), then t > T(ED(s)))
Then premises:
P1: ∀v∀s∀t(If v affects s at t, then v causally affects s at t) P2: ∀v∀s∀t(If v causally affects s at t, then s exists at t) P3: ∀v∀s∀t(If harm3(v,s,t), then v affects s at t) P4: ∀v∀s∀t(If v causally affects s at t, then t ≥ T(v)) P5: ∀v∀s(If t > T(ED(s)), then it is not the case that s exists at t)
Here are the conclusions to be reached:
C1: No posthumous event harms us; i.e.,
∀v∀s(If v is posthumous for s, then ~harm2(v,s))C2: We are not harmed by the state of our being dead; i.e.,
∀v∀s∀t(If SD(v,s,t), then ~harm2(v,s))C3: The event of death harms us, if at all, only when it occurs; i.e.,
∀v∀s∀t(If v=ED(s) & harm3(v,s,t), then t = T(ED(s)))
Argument for C1:
Let v1 be any event or state, s1 any subject and t1 any time.
| 1. | v1 is posthumous for s1 | (assumption for conditional introduction) |
| 2. | harm2(v1, s1) | (assumption for reductio ad absurdum) |
| 3. | T(v1) > T(ED(s1)) | (1, A2, UI, biconditional elimination) |
| 4. | harm3(v1, s1,t) | (2, A1, UI, biconditional elimination, MP) |
| 5. | harm3(v1, s1, t1) | (4, EI) |
| 6. | v1 affects s1 at t1 | (5, P3, UI, MP) |
| 7. | v1 causally affects s1 at t1 | (6, P1, UI, MP) |
| 8. | t1 > T(v1) | (7, P4, UI, MP) |
| 9. | t1 > T(ED(s1)) | (8, 3, transitivity of >) |
| 10. | ~s1 exists at t1 | (9, P5, UI, MP) |
| 11. | s1 exists at t1 | (7, P2, UI, MP) |
| 12. | ~harm2(v1, s1) | (2, 10,11, reductio ad absurdum |
| 13. | If v1 is posthumous for s1, then ~harm2(v1, s1) | (1, 13, conditional introduction) |
| 14. | ∀v∀s(If v is posthumous for s, then ~harm2(v,s)) | (13 UG) |
Argument for C2:
Let v1 be any event or state, s1 any subject and t1 any time.
| 1. | SD(v1, s1, t1) | (assumption for conditional introduction) |
| 2. | t1 > T(ED(s1)) | (1, A3, UI, MP)) |
| 3. | v1 is posthumous for s1 | (2, A2, biconditional elimination) |
| 4. | ~harm2(v1, s1) | (3, C1, UI, MP) |
| 5. | If SD(v1, s1,
t1), then ~harm2(v1, s1) |
(1, 4, CI) |
| 6. | ∀v∀s∀t(If SD(v,s,t), then ~harm2(v,s)) | (5, UG) |
Argument for C3:
Let v1 be any event or state, s1any subject and t1 any time.
| 1. | v1 = ED(s1) & harm3(v1, s1, t1) | (assumption for conditional introduction) |
| 2. | harm3(ED(s1), s1, t1) | (1, simplication, substitution) |
| 3. | ED(s1) affects s1 at t1 | (2, P3, UI, MP) |
| 4. | ED(s1) causally affects s1 at t1 | (3, P1, UI, MP) |
| 5. | t1 ≥ T(ED(s1)) | (4, P4, UI, MP) |
| 6. | t1 > T(ED(s1)) | (assumption for reductio ad absurdum) |
| 7. | ~s1 exists at t1 | (6, P5, UI, MP) |
| 8. | s1 exists at t1 | (4, P2, UI, MP) |
| 9. | ~t1 > T(ED(s1)) | (6, 8, reductio ad absurdum) |
| 10. | t1 = T(ED(s1)) | (5, 9, disjunctive syllogism) |
| 11. | If v1=ED(s1) & harm3(v1,s1,t1), then t1 = T(ED(s1)) | (1, 10, conditional introduction) |
| 12. | ∀v∀s∀t(If v=ED(s) & harm3(v,s,t), then t = T(ED(s)) | (11, UG) |