Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
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Business Ethics

First published Wed Apr 16, 2008

In concept, business ethics is the applied ethics discipline that addresses the moral features of commercial activity. In practice, however, a dizzying array of projects is pursued under its rubric. Programs of legal compliance, empirical studies into the moral beliefs and attitudes of business people, a panoply of best-practices claims (in the name of their moral merit or their contribution to business success), arguments for (or against) mandatory worker participation in management, and attempts at applying traditional ethical theories, theories of justice, or theories of the state to firms or to the functional areas of business are all advanced as contributions to business ethics—even and especially in its academic literature. These projects vary considerably and often seem to have little in common other than the conviction, held by those who pursue them, that whatever each is pursuing is business ethics.

This entry focuses generally on academic business ethics, more particularly on the philosophically-informed part of business ethics, and most particularly on the constellation of philosophically-relevant questions that inform the main conversation and ongoing disagreement among academic business ethicists. It covers: (1) the history of business ethics as an academic endeavor; (2) the focus on the corporation in academic business ethics; (3) the treatment of the employment relation in academic business ethics; (4) the treatment of transnational issues in academic business ethics; and (5) criticism of the focus and implicit methodology of academic business ethics.

1. History

Construed broadly as moral reflection on commerce, business ethics is probably as old as trade itself. If law is a rough guide to widely-held moral intuitions (Gooden 1985), the Code of Hammurabi (1700s B.C.), prescribing prices and tariffs and laying down both rules of commerce and harsh penalties for noncompliance, evidences some of civilization's earlier attempts to establish the moral contours of commercial activity. Aristotle's Politics (300s B.C.) addresses explicitly commercial relations in its discussion of household management. Judeo-Christian morality, as expressed in, e.g., the Talmud (200 A.D.) and the Ten Commandments (Exodus 20:2-17; Deuteronomy 5:6-21), includes moral rules applicable to commercial conduct.

As a discrete, self-conscious academic discipline, business ethics is roughly four decades old. Raymond Baumhart's (1961, 1963, 1968) groundbreaking studies in the 1960s are generally understood to be early contributions to business ethics. Richard DeGeorge (2005) dates academic business ethics to the 1970s, identifying Baumhart as a forerunner to a self-conscious academic business ethics. Prominent contemporary business ethicist Norman Bowie dates the field's first academic conference to 1974 (DeGeorge 2005).

Although academic instruction explicitly devoted to the relationship between ethics and commerce can be found in U.S. business schools as early as the first three decades of the 20th century, particularly in Catholic colleges and universities, creation of academic positions dedicated explicitly to business ethics in U.S. business schools tracks closely waves of corporate scandal from the 1980s to the present. In 1987, in the midst of the insider trading scandal on Wall Street, former Securities and Exchange Commission head John Shad gave the Harvard Business School over $30 million for the purpose of starting a business ethics program there. Subsequent philanthropy from a number of sources financed the creation of prominent endowed chairs at the University of Virginia's Darden School, the University of Pennsylvania's Wharton School, and other business schools. Today, academic positions in business ethics, whether endowed chairs or ordinary faculty positions, are found frequently in U.S. business schools and in philosophy departments, as well.

Academic business ethicists address questions that range across the functional areas of business, giving rise to various recognized specialties in business ethics (e.g., marketing ethics, finance ethics, accounting ethics). But despite the wide range of questions pursued, the bulk of the academic literature and discussion is focused more closely on (and much of the function-specific work is connected closely to) the large corporation whose ownership shares are traded on public exchanges.

2. The Corporation in Business Ethics

Although self-conscious, academic business ethics is of recent vintage, its intellectual roots are found in the corporate social responsibility (CSR) and business-and-society literatures originating in law and in business in the early and middle 20th century (see, e.g., Berle and Means 1932). Academic business ethics displays its CSR heritage in the peculiar constellation of concerns that pervade its literature. Those concerns surround the business corporation, which Robert Solomon (1991) calls “the basic unit of commerce today.”

The corporate focus is evident in the titles of early works of academic business ethics that have done much to shape the subsequent discussion in the field. Tom Donaldson's Corporations and Morality (1982) and Patricia Werhane's Persons, Rights, and Corporations (1985) take business ethics to be concerned centrally with questions about the corporation's proper role in and relationship to the social order. These questions, taken up by the field and continuing to inform its main conversation, are said to surround the “moral status of the corporation,” by which is meant typically one or both of: (1) Is the corporation a moral agent, distinct from the persons who compose it? (2) Morally, how or in whose interests ought the corporation to be managed?

2.1 Is the corporation a moral agent?

At law, the corporation is a person, distinct in its personality from the persons who bear ownership shares in it (its shareholders) or conduct activities on its behalf (its directors, officers, and other employees). Among the many manifestations of the corporation's separate legal personality are: (i) Distributions of dividends from the corporation to its shareholders are subject to income taxation in the same way that gifts between persons are subject to income taxation. If the corporation were not a separate legal person (as, for example, in U.S. and English law a partnership is not a separate legal person from the partners who compose it) the distribution of dividends would not a be a taxable event (because money would not be changing hands). (ii) Corporations are subject to civil liability that is distinct from that of its owners. Indeed, one of the principal motivations for organizing business activities in the corporate form is that corporate assets are legally separate from the personal assets of the corporation's shareholders. Shareholder liability for corporate debts is limited to whatever assets owners have contributed to the corporation in return for their ownership stakes. (iii) Corporations are subject to criminal liability that is distinct from that of its owners, directors, officers, or employees.

If the corporation is a legal person, is it also a moral person? Anglo-American law takes no explicit position on this, although the corporate personality is frequently described there as a legal fiction, suggesting that the corporation's legally recognized personality is not also ontological fact. Business ethicists have taken a variety of positions on the question whether the corporation is a moral person or moral agent.

Peter French (1979, 1984, 1995) argues that important features of the corporation and corporate decision making exhibit all of the necessary components of moral agency. He argues that corporations have corporate internal decision (CID) structures that provide sufficient grounds for attributing moral agency to them. These CID structures consist of two main parts: (i) an organization chart that corresponds to decision authority within the corporation and (ii) rules (usually contained in the corporation's articles of incorporation or its by-laws) for determining whether a decision, made by one who possesses decision making authority according to the organization chart, is a corporate decision rather than merely a personal decision. That is, analogous to H.L.A. Hart's (1961) rule of recognition for determining whether a norm is a legal norm, there is also a rule of recognition (or set of rules of recognition) for determining whether a decision is a corporate decision. Combining the organization chart with the rule(s) of recognition, one identifies corporate actions, intentions, and aims—the stuff of moral agency in natural persons. Thus, for French, corporations are both legal and moral persons, and hence moral agents in their own right.

To the contrary, Manuel Velasquez (1983) argues that the CID structures to which French appeals are the product of human agency and design. They are rules of cooperation among persons who, given their actions, intentions, and aims, associate under the corporate banner. Attributing moral agency to corporations opens the door to the intuitively implausible conclusion that a corporation can be morally responsible for something no natural person connected with it is responsible for.

2.2 How and in whose interests ought the corporation to be governed?

Seeing the large, publicly-traded corporation as the key actor in business, most academic business ethicists understand the foundational normative question of their discipline to be that of how and in whose interests corporations ought to be governed. Over the last two decades, the main attempts to answer this foundational normative question have been understood as constituting a ‘shareholder-stakeholder debate’ in business ethics.

Originating in the work of R. Edward Freeman (1984), stakeholder theory is widely regarded among academic business ethicists as the most significant theoretical construct in their discipline. Normative ethical stakeholder theory articulates the view that a business firm ought to be managed in a way that achieves a balance among the interests of all who bear a substantial relationship to the firm—its stakeholders. In Freeman's account, the very purpose of the firm is coordination of and joint service to its stakeholders.

This characterization is vague, but deliberately so. For the normative ethical stakeholder theory literature in business ethics consists principally in attempts to address one or more of the questions (whether ethical, ontological, or epistemic) this characterization leaves unanswered: Who counts, i.e., who are the stakeholders? What interests, held by those who count, count? What is balance, why is it valuable, and how is one charged with achieving it to know when it has been achieved or what activities promote it? How are the ends, values, or practices commended by stakeholder theory incompatible with directors and officers extending the partiality entailed by fiduciary care to shareholders, such that stakeholder theory stands as a rival to the so-called shareholder theory (about which more below)? Whatever the success of stakeholder theorists in answering these questions, there can be little doubt that stakeholder theory's mode of analysis (identifying stakeholders and their interests; asking how these interests ought to be accommodated, served, subordinated, or traded-off in directing the firm's activities) is the one academic business ethicists adopt most readily in considering the moral controversies they address.

‘Shareholder theory’ is not so much a distinct, univocal normative ethical theory of the firm as it is a shorthand, usually applied by those sympathetic to stakeholder theory to what they understand stakeholder theory to oppose. (A leading encyclopedic dictionary (Werhane and Freeman 1997) boasts a handful of mentions of, but no entry devoted to, shareholder theory.) Thus, ‘shareholder theory’ may be used to describe a defense of prevailing institutions and practices (‘the status quo’), the extension of fiduciary care by officers and directors to a firm's equity owners, or an account of a firm's function derived from neoclassical economics.

Canonically, shareholder theory is understood to be an encapsulation of the views advanced by Milton Friedman (1970) in his famous New York Times Magazine article, “The Social Responsibility of Business Is to Increase Its Profits.” But the appellation is applied most often in the academic business ethics literature to arguments seeking to legitimate morally managerial fiduciary duties owed to a corporation's shareholders—whatever the particular grounds for holding that such managerial partiality is justified. So understood, arguments that managerial partiality to shareholder interests is justified by consequentialist considerations (Boatright 1994), by contract-as-promise (Sollars 2002), by the peculiar vulnerabilities of those bearing the residual risk in the firm (Marcoux 2003), or by the idea that claims to fiduciary care are themselves among a firm's residual claims (Macey 1999) are all contributions to shareholder theory.

More recently, Donaldson, writing with Tom Dunfee (Donaldson and Dunfee 1999), has sought to advance a contractarian theory that provides a framework for settling not just questions of how and in whose interests firms ought to be managed, but also most any ethical question that may arise in the context of doing business. Integrative Social Contracts Theory (ISCT) posits a bi-level array of social contracts in which a single, hypothetical social contract serving a largely adjudicative function with respect to the many extant, actual social contracts in terms of which business relationships are structured. Equally opposed to what is often characterized as shareholder theory, ISCT's relationship to stakeholder theory (and hence to the shareholder-stakeholder debate) is unclear. In some moments, Donaldson and Dunfee (1999) characterize ISCT as a form of, or the completion of, normative ethical stakeholder theory. In others, it appears to emerge more as a rival to stakeholder theory.

Underlying the shareholder-stakeholder debate is a disagreement over the analogies in terms of which we ought to understand the firm. Stakeholder theorists generally see strong parallels between firms and political states. Call this the firm-state analogy. Under the firm-state analogy, a firm's stakeholders are like citizens in a polity. Stakeholder theory is an attempt to elucidate the just claims of citizens (stakeholders) in that polity (the firm). It takes the rich citizenship rights characteristic of liberal democracies as the paradigm for considering each stakeholder's legitimate claims on the firm. Thus, stakeholder theorists see normative political philosophy as a natural source of theoretical constructs and normative principles applicable to the governance of firms (Freeman and Evan 1990; McMahon 1994; Moriarty 2005).

By contrast, defenders of extending fiduciary care to a firm's shareholders frequently appeal, implicitly or explicitly, to the idea that the firm is better understood as either an actual agreement among its stakeholders (Sollars 2002) or else a point of intersection to the many agreements that together make up the firm—a so-called nexus-of-contracts, as the firm is usually understood in neoclassical economics. Call this the firm-contract analogy. Under the firm-contract analogy, a firm's stakeholders are just contractors, people who have agreements with other people. The firm is less an actor (much less, a polity) than a Schelling point around which agreements get made, or a Lockean substrate on which agreements rest. Thus, those who are characterized as shareholder theorists usually see prescriptions of normative political philosophy derived from concepts like citizenship as poor guides to the governance of firms.

Which analogy strikes one more compelling depends upon how one conceives of the relative and absolute availability of exit and voice opportunities (Hirschmann 1970) to a firm's stakeholders. The rich voice rights characterizing just polities in much of normative political philosophy are compelling in significant part because one generally is bound to a political state and cannot exit that political state except for another political state. However, rich voice rights are less compelling as a model of just human interaction where liberal exit opportunities exist. Organizational hierarchies and terms of employment that would be intolerable as conditions of citizenship in a polity may be unexceptional in the context of a firm, owing to the consensual aspect of participating in a firm and the richer right to and availability of exit from the arrangement.

It is not surprising, then, that much in the shareholder-stakeholder debate turns on how theorists characterize the exit opportunities available to a firm's stakeholders (Maitland 1994). Stakeholder theorists emphasize circumstances in which exit opportunities are costly, especially for non-shareholding stakeholders, in order to justify voice rights, e.g., strong rights of participation in a firm's governance (Freeman and Evan 1990), or other claims, e.g., protection against termination of employment. Shareholder theorists emphasize rights of exit and the wide array of options available in vibrant markets, especially to non-shareholding stakeholders, that have no analogue in the more static world of political states.

Unlike the case of corporate moral agency, wherein the corporate form is itself the source of the debate, the virtually exclusive focus on the large, publicly-traded corporation in the shareholder-stakeholder debate is strange. For the same questions about how and in whose interests firms ought to be managed arise also, and often more forcefully, in firms doing business in forms other than the publicly-traded corporate one. Closely-held corporations and partnerships lack the fluid markets for ownership shares that make exit a viable choice for the disgruntled shareholder. Moreover, closely-held corporations and partnerships are marked frequently by widely diverging interests among members of the ownership class, whether due to the fact that some of those members are in day-to-day control of the enterprise whereas others are not, or that one or a small coalition of owners form an effective voting majority of shareholders, leaving minority shareholder interests to the majority's mercy.

3. The Employment Relation in Business Ethics

Falling neatly out of concern about the power of large, publicly traded corporations is a concern about the terms of employment they afford. The discussion of the employment relation in academic business ethics has crystallized into a debate over the relative moral merits of at-will employment terms and just cause employment terms, especially in light of the place each occupies in employment law.

Absent a contract to the contrary, in the great bulk of U.S. jurisdictions the employment relation is governed by the at-will doctrine. Under the at-will doctrine, an employment relation may be terminated by either party (employer, employee), for any reason or no reason at all, without notice. At-will employment thus constitutes a default contract—it is the agreement that obtains between employers and employees absent an agreement to the contrary (e.g., a union contract). Over time, both statutory and case law have carved out a number of exceptions to the at-will doctrine. Thus, the at-will doctrine will not protect an employer who uses the power of termination to engage in racial discrimination, punish an employee for refusing to violate the law, and so forth. Absent circumstances covered by the exceptions, however, the at-will doctrine remains the basic rule governing employment relations in most of the U.S.

Most of the discussion of the employment relation in academic business ethics concerns the fairness of the at-will doctrine and whether other terms of employment ought to be substituted for it through public policy initiatives. Indeed, the debate makes little sense outside the public policy context. On broadly Kantian grounds, Werhane (1985) argues that arbitrary dismissal is incompatible with respecting employees as persons. Respecting employees as persons demands that they be supplied with good reasons when adverse action is taken against them. Thus, at-will employment (or at least, dismissal without cause undertaken in accordance with the at-will doctrine) is incompatible with recognizing and respecting the employee's personhood.

Werhane's argument may depend on an equivocation between giving employees reasons and giving employees reasons on the merits. That is, even if one accepts that, morally, employees as persons are owed reasons, it doesn't follow that the reasons they are owed are reasons that go to, e.g., their job performance, the firm's economic prospects, etc. The at-will doctrine supplies a reason. It says that the terms of our arrangement are such that any of us has the option to terminate it at our discretion. That, coupled with exercise of one's discretion, is sufficient reason to terminate the arrangement. Many decisions affecting persons are settled on the basis of reasons that do not refer to the merits of the case. At law, for example, a plaintiff's case may be dismissed because the statute of limitations has run, because it was filed in the wrong jurisdiction, because the court is not competent to hear the case, etc. None of these are reasons on the merits, but it would be strange to conclude that these dispositions of their claims fail to respect plaintiffs' personhood.

Arguments advanced in defense of the at-will doctrine lean heavily on consequentialist considerations. (But see, e.g., Maitland 1989, for an argument that defends the at-will doctrine on rights grounds.) Proponents attribute the vibrant labor market of the United States and the stagnant labor markets of Europe to the prevalence of the at-will doctrine in the United States and the prevalence of mandatory just cause employment rules in Europe. Mandatory just cause rules are a significant disincentive to job creation and to the pursuit of labor-intensive entrepreneurial ventures because they impose heavy record-keeping and infrastructure requirements on firms. Richard Epstein (1984) puts the point succinctly: “Harder to fire mean harder to hire.” Similarly, David Schmidtz (1998) observes that young black males in the United States enjoy greater employment prospects than do young white males in France in the course of arguing for freer markets in labor—markets that include a default at-will employment contract. The point is that employees can be protected from the ill-effects of arbitrary dismissal in two ways. One way, favored by just cause advocates, is legally. The other way is through the promotion of a vibrant labor market in which jobs are frequently created and readily available. The at-will doctrine lubricates vibrant labor markets by reducing the costs and the stakes of disputes over dismissal. Mandatory just cause rules do the opposite.

The consequentialist case for the at-will doctrine depends critically on the vicissitudes of the labor market and what one considers its normal or usual state to be. When the labor market is strong, as in the middle 1980s or late 1990s U.S., that case is compelling. When it is weak, as in the late 1970s or early 1980s U.S., then it is less so.

Some of the more interesting and sophisticated contributions to the debate by just cause proponents come from outside the business ethics literature. In the legal literature, the trend among just cause proponents is toward acknowledging the appeal of a default rule regime like that in which at-will employment is the default, but arguing that the default ought instead to be just cause. Cass Sunstein (2002), for example, argues that the best world is one in which we capture the benefits of a default rule regime, including permitting those best served by at-will employment to enter into at-will arrangements, but in which the default rule is just cause. He favors the just cause default rule on the grounds that behavioral economics research shows that people are influenced heavily by default rules and default choices. In addition, people tend to regard benefits they already possess as more important than those they can bargain for (i.e., they exhibit what social psychologists call the endowment effect). Consequently, Sunstein believes that just cause default rules will yield more employees covered by just cause, which outcome he holds to be an improvement, but at the same time will permit employers and employees genuinely and mutually better served by at-will rules to contract for them instead.

David Millon (1998) favors a just cause default rule, by contrast, on the grounds that it will permit employees to hold out for higher wages in return for becoming at-will employees. He acknowledges that just cause employment rules are costly, but believes that avoidance of those costs, in favor of more efficient at-will employment relations, will motivate employers to be more generous in their wage offers. In sum, Millon sees changing the default rule from at-will to just cause as a redistributive strategy, not as a means of getting more employees covered by just cause employment rules.

The debate over at-will employment is a debate not about what employers and employees ought or ought not to do, but instead about the merits of taking the terms of employment continuation out of the realm of contract and into the realm of public policy. In that sense, it is more like the debate over the minimum wage. The at-will doctrine neither commends nor incentivizes a managerial practice. Instead, it apportions the legal risk of arbitrary firing in a way different than just cause rules do. Which apportionment is better may tell us much about the public policies we ought to have, but it doesn't tell us how we ought to conduct business.

4. International Business Ethics

Doing business transnationally raises a number of issues that have no analogue in business dealings done within a single country or legal jurisdiction. International business ethics seeks to address those issues. Where ethical norms are in conflict, owing to different cultural practices, which ethical norms ought to guide one's business conduct in other nations and cultures? Some discussions of international business ethics conceive this home country/host country question as central. On one hand, adopting host country norms is a way to respect the host culture and its members. Thus, business persons are advised that when in Rome they ought do as the Romans do—as in etiquette, so too in ethics. On the other hand, business persons are advised to resist host country norms that are morally repugnant. Therein lies the rub. When, for example, bribery of officials is central to doing business where you are, ought you to embrace the practice as a mark of cultural respect or forswear the practice on the grounds that it is morally repugnant?

One common approach in international business ethics is to refer to or to construct lists of norms that ought to guide transnational business conduct. Thus, for example, the United Nations' Universal Declaration of Human Rights or, more recently, the United Nations Global Compact, is advanced as a guide to conduct. The UN Global Compact enjoins business firms to support and respect internationally recognized human rights, avoid complicity in human rights abuses, uphold freedom of association and collective bargaining, eliminate forced and compulsory labor, eliminate child labor, eliminate all forms of discrimination in employment, support a precautionary approach to environmental challenges, promote greater environmental responsibility, encourage the development of environmentally friendly technologies, and work against corruption in all its forms, including extortion and bribery. Alternatively, whether inspired by something like the UN Global Compact, a preferred moral theory, a preferred theory of justice, or some combination of these or other factors, other lists of norms are proposed as guides to the ethical practice of transnational business. DeGeorge (1993), for example, advances ten guidelines for the conduct of multinational firms doing business in less developed countries. These guidelines call for the avoiding harm, doing good, respecting human rights, respecting the local culture, cooperating with just governments and institutions, accepting ethical responsibility for one's actions, and making hazardous plants and technologies safe. Among other uses, Donaldson and Dunfee (1999) see the hypothetical, macrosocial contract in ISCT providing an ideal framework for adjudicating questions of transnational business conduct.

The problems with these approaches appear to be threefold. First, they tend to minimize or ignore competitive reality. Imagine that our firm takes seriously the UN Global Compact. We do business in a less developed country with longstanding environmental and corruption problems. We are implementing a significant environmental initiative in this country, but find that our ability to do so depends upon securing licenses from a corrupt government bureaucracy. If we refuse to pay bribes, we will be unable to implement our initiative and, moreover, we will lose market share and our economic rationale for locating operations in this country to competitors who have no compunction about paying such bribes. Ought we to pay bribes for the sake of environmental improvement and maintaining a presence in this country or forsake the environment and a presence in this country in order to strike a blow against corruption? Although not focusing explicitly on the international context, Ronald Green (1991) stands virtually alone in taking seriously the question of when and under what conditions ‘everyone's doing it’ is a moral justification—a question that arises regularly when doing business transnationally and in competitive markets. Second, these approaches serve mainly to reduplicate the home country/host country question they are intended to help answer. Thus, when enjoined by DeGeorge to cooperate with just governments and institutions, which and whose sense of justice ought to guide the determination of whether the governments and institutions are to be cooperated with? Third, even when enjoining respect for local cultures and moral norms, these approaches tend to privilege Western conceptions of justice, fairness, and ethics. Thus, in Donaldson and Dunfee's ISCT, it is a hypothetical social contract—a concept itself embodying Western notions of procedural fairness—that is supposed to adjudicate clashes between home country and host country, including Western and non-Western, norms and practices.

Moreover, the more interesting home country/host country cases are those where home country norms are explicitly extraterritorial and incompatible with host country norms. In ‘Italian Tax Mores’, a case widely republished in business ethics textbooks and anthologies (see, e.g., Gini 2005: 70-71), Arthur Kelly tells of American firms doing business in Italy. American securities regulations, accounting principles, and conceptions of commercial integrity require firms to account for their tax liability (including foreign tax liability) fully and correctly, with that liability matching what appears on their tax returns. Italian tax authorities, by contrast, take a firm's tax return to constitute not a full and correct accounting, but an initial negotiating position to which they then make a counteroffer. A firm's final tax liability is settled through negotiation between the tax authorities and the firm. Consequently, an American firm's tax liability for its Italian operations will likely never match what is reported on its tax return, in contravention of securities regulations, good accounting practice, and conceptions of commercial integrity back home. General principles of good conduct and hypothetical social contracts seem not to speak to what tax accountants and auditors ought to do, given the institutions and norms that actually confront them.

International business ethics has taken on a new urgency with the emergence of globalization. Low transaction and communication costs, driven by advances in computer and telecommunication technologies, have made the global market, once a metaphor (and at least for some, an aspiration), truly global. Transnational business is increasingly the rule rather than the exception, especially in the production of shoes, clothing, automobiles, and other commodity goods. Nowhere has this urgency been felt more acutely than in the debate over so-called sweatshop labor—the hiring of workers in less developed countries, usually at wages and under work conditions prevailing in those countries, to manufacture products for the developed world.

Opponents of sweatshop labor argue that multinational firms like Nike wrongfully exploit poor work and wage conditions in less developed countries. They argue that, when contracting for labor in less developed countries, multinational firms are duty-bound to pay living wages and ensure that work conditions more closely approximate those that prevail in the developed world.

In a paper much reprinted and anthologized, Ian Maitland (1997) argues that sweatshops constitute for many less developed countries an important rung on the ladder to economic development. Although small relative to the developed world, wages paid in factories serving multinationals like Nike exceed, often by a wide margin, those prevailing in the surrounding economy. The same is true of working conditions. Consequently, sweatshops are a force for the better in the less developed countries in which they appear. They demonstrate the abilities of the local work force, serve to raise local wages as local firms and other multinationals compete for the best employees, and through the extra-market wages they pay facilitate the personal savings and capital formation on which economic development depends. Demanding that multinationals pay even more, so-called living wages—by which is generally meant wages that closely approximate those prevailing in the developed world—is to effectively deny workers in the less developed world the opportunity to compete in the world labor market. For the outcome of a mandatory living wage is not sweatshop workers being paid more, but multinationals keeping factories in places where the market wage parallels the living one (usually the developed world). This promises to leave sweatshop workers working for the (lower) prevailing wages and in the (poorer) prevailing conditions that their local economies, absent the multinationals, offer. According to Maitland, opponents of sweatshop labor are guilty of allowing the perfect to be the enemy of the good.

Maitland's critics have replied generally by disputing the effects that flow from living wage mandates and other proposals for overcoming sweatshop labor. Denis Arnold and Norman Bowie (2003), for example, argue that Kantian respect for persons demands payment of a living wage. They maintain that the minimum wage research of economists David Card and Alan Krueger (1995) demonstrates that raising the wages of low-wage workers lacks the unemployment effects that Maitland predicts. As sweatshop workers earn wages that are usually below those of U.S. minimum wage workers, it is likely that they will escape the unemployment effect. Just as which corporate analogy (firm-state, firm-contract) is more compelling depends upon how one understands the relative and absolute availability of exit from the firm, which sweatshop argument is more compelling depends, at least in part, on the economics. Where the Card and Krueger study fits within the larger body of research about the minimum wage is a matter of dispute among economists. How economists come down on it will have implications for at least one, important aspect of the sweatshop labor debate in business ethics.

5. Criticism

The main conversation in academic business ethics is focused on the large, publicly traded corporation. It owes its prescriptions mainly to normative political philosophy, rather than moral theory. It speaks more to public policy toward business (and especially the large, publicly traded corporation) and the institutions of capitalism than it does to ethical business conduct, i.e., what one ought to be doing when one is doing business.

That academic business ethics is focused mainly on public policy toward the large corporation and the institutions of capitalism can be seen in a characterization of the field due to Solomon (1991). Solomon distinguishes three levels of business ethics analysis or argument, which he calls the micro, the macro, and the molar. The micro level concerns “the rules for fair exchange between two individuals.” The macro level concerns “the institutional or cultural rules of commerce for an entire society” (‘the business world’). The molar level (‘molar’ from the Latin moles, meaning ‘mass’) concerns “the basic unit of commerce today—the corporation” (1991: 359). Although Solomon is careful to describe and articulate the central questions of the macro and molar levels of business ethics, the micro level—the level at which people do business—isn't favored with a similar treatment in his discussion. Solomon's macro level business ethics addresses the relationship between political society and economic activity. It “becomes part and parcel of those large questions about justice, legitimacy, and the nature of society that constitute social and political philosophy” (1991: 359). His molar level is a response the fact that, according to Solomon, “the central questions of business ethics tend to be unabashedly aimed at the directors and employees of those few thousand or so companies that rule so much of commercial life around the world” (1991: 359).

As the macro and molar conversations (conversations that are clearly derivative of normative political philosophy) dominate academic business ethics, some wonder what its distinctive contribution is supposed to be and what is the justification for including it (and often, requiring it) in the business school curriculum. Much of academic business ethics's content is contentious, depending upon highly debatable claims about justice, and argues for institutions unlikely to be the ones within which business persons will operate. Consequently, it says less about what one ought to do when doing business than is generally supposed or advertised.

This criticism comes in milder and stronger variants. Andrew Stark (1993) faults academic business ethics for its overemphasis on issues of public policy and top-level corporate decision making. He calls instead for a business ethics focused more on the quotidian decisions and dilemmas of the middle manager. Stark's criticisms are mild because he endorses generally the large, publicly-traded corporate and organizational focus, seeking only to make the subject matter more practical and pitched more to the middle and less to the top-level manager. Joseph Heath (2006) finds academic business ethics's reduction of all issues to battles of stakeholder interests both myopic and misleading. In its place, he favors a methodological approach that sees unregulated market failures, rather than clashes of stakeholder interests, as the principal occasion for ethical deliberation and restraint.

In the stronger form, criticism of academic business ethics can focus on its apparent irrelevance to the vast majority of business persons in the world. That majority works neither for nor with (and certainly doesn't lead) large, publicly traded corporations, yet they surely engage in business. Whether characterized as micro-enterprises, small businesses, or in some other way, the great body of academic business ethics has little to say about the circumstances faced by that majority. Although conceptually the micro level business ethics of which Solomon writes speaks to the circumstances of that worldwide majority, in practice that micro ethics is little developed by and commands scant attention from academic business ethicists. Tethered by its CSR heritage, academic business ethics emerges as a discussion focused on large-scale, North America and Europe-based firms, perhaps with similarly large-scale Asia-based firms included, as well. Except as the potential object of predation by these large-scale firms, business done in the rest of the world and business done outside the large, publicly-traded corporate sectors of North America, Europe, and Asia fall mostly outside the field's purview. In a more methodological vein, Nicholas Capaldi (2006) argues that philosophy's contribution to business ethics needs to be a form of explication, rather than exploration. Its purpose should be to articulate the norms internal to and inherent in business practice (just as legal ethics does with respect to legal practice and medical ethics does with respect to medical practice), rather than to submit briefs on behalf of ideal economic institutions favored by university academics.

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