Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Notes to Pragmatist Feminism

1. Although he had not published or worked in education before moving to Chicago, some of Dewey's letters to his wife indicate that he had been thinking about starting a school before he came to Chicago, and Dewey had some insight on educational matters from Harris.

2. Seigfried discusses Dewey's support of feminist causes in “John Dewey's Pragmatist Feminism” in Larry Hickman, ed. Reading Dewey: Interpretations for a Postmodern Generation.

3. Early in her career, Jane Addams rejected the possibility that a solution to a social issue could be developed by one group of people and applied to another. She said that all classes and all people must contribute to the creation of the social good. “We have learned to say that the good must be extended to all of society before it can be held secure by one person or one class; but we have not yet learned to add the statement that unless all men [sic] and classes contribute to that good, we cannot even be sure that it is worth having” (2002 [1902], 97). This is a lesson that contemporary American feminist have needed to learn regarding women's issues in other countries.

4. In Peirce's “The Fixation of Belief.” See Rooney 1993, 21.