Notes to Libertarianism

1. Kirzner (1978) also argues against any fair share condition. He does so, however, on the ground that those who discover a resource are actually creating it and that creators are entitled to their creations. I believe that this argument fails, but cannot here argue the point.

2. Nozick (1974) sometimes interprets the proviso as requiring only that the system of private property make no one worse off than a system of common use (where everyone is free to use what they want). Given his act-based theory, however, this appeal to systems is inappropriate.

3. The term “left-libertarianism” is also used to refer to political views, such as those of Noam Chomsky or Roderick Long, that are suspicious of concentrations of power in general (in government, in corporations, in social institutions, etc.)

4. Steiner (1994) argues that germ-line genetic information is a natural resource and appeals to this as a way of compensating for unequal internal endowments.

5. Van Parijs (1995) is in the same spirit as equal opportunity left-libertarianism—although with significant twists on gifts and job rents.

6. Nozick (1974) presents a highly hypothetical, and highly controversial, scenario describing how one could come to have such an enforceable obligation to pay for basic police services.