Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Supplement to Deontic Logic

Kripke-Style Semantics for Kd

We define the frames for modeling Kd as follows:

F is an Kd Frame: F = <W, R, DEM> such that:
  1. W is a non-empty set
  2. R is a subset of W × W
  3. DEM is a subset of W
  4. ij(Rij & j ∈ DEM).

A model can be defined in the usual way, allowing us to then define truth at a world in a model for all sentences of Kd (as well as for KTd):

M is an Kd Model: M = <F,V>, where F is an Kd Frame, <W,R,DEM>, and V is an assignment on F: V is a function from the propositional variables to various subsets of W.

Basic Truth-Conditions at a world, i, in a Model, M:

[PC]: (Standard Clauses for the operators of Propositional Logic.)
[□]: Mip iff ∀j(if Rij then Mj p).
[d]: Mi d iff i ∈ DEM.

Derivative Truth-Conditions:

[◊]: Mip: ∃j(Rij & Mj p)
[OB]: Mi OBp: ∀j[if Rij & j ∈ DEM then Mj p]
[PE]: Mi PEp: ∃j(Rij & j ∈ DEM & Mj p)
[IM]: Mi IMp: ∀j[if Rij & j ∈ DEM then Mj ~p]
[OM]: Mi OMp: ∃j(Rij & j ∈ DEM & Mj ~p)
[OP]: Mi OPp: ∃j(Rij & j ∈ DEM & Mj p) & ∃j(Rij & j ∈ DEM & Mj ~p)

(Truth in a model and validity are defined just as for SDL.)

Metatheorem: Kd is sound and complete for the class of all Kd models.

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