Definition of the Concept of Admissible Set

A nonempty transitive set A is said to be admissible when the following conditions are satisfied:

(i) if a, b ∈ A, then {a, b} ∈ A and ∪A ∈ A;

(ii) if a ∈ A and X ⊆ A is Δ₀ on A, then X ∩ a ∈ A;

(iii) if a ∈ A, X ⊆ A is Δ₀ on A, and ∀x∈a∃y(<x,y> ∈X), then, for some b ∈ A, ∀x∈a∃y∈b(< x,y> ∈ X).

Condition (ii) -- the Δ₀-separation scheme -- is a restricted version of Zermelo's axiom of separation. Condition (iii) -- a similarly weakened version of the axiom of replacement -- may be called the Δ₀-replacement scheme.

It is quite easy to see that if A is a transitive set such that <A, ∈| A> is a model of ZFC, then A is admissible. More generally, the result continues to hold when the power set axiom is omitted from ZFC, so that both H(ω) and H(ω₁) are admissible. However, since the latter is uncountable, the Barwise compactness theorem fails to apply to it.