Notes to Marriage and Domestic Partnership

1. The reference is to Ulysses tying himself to the mast so that he can hear the sirens' song without jumping overboard.

2. Marriage does not bring benefits exclusively: in the U.S., it can bring a tax ‘penalty’ to dual-income couples with similar incomes as well as a tax ‘bonus’ to disparate-income couples. For comprehensive summaries of the many implications of marriage in U.S. federal law, see the 1997 U.S. General Accounting Office Report on marriage—see the Other Internet Resources for the 1997 report and the 2003 update.