Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Notes to Punishment

1. Twentieth Century Fund, Fair and Certain Punishment, New York: McGraw-Hill, 1976; von Hirsch 1976; Singer 1979.

2. See, e.g., H.M. Hart, Jr. 1958, H.L.A. Hart 1959, Honderich 1976, Feinberg 1965, Wasserstrom 1980, Gross 1979, Richards 1977, Hoekema 1986, Lacey 1988, Ten 1987, and Walker 1991.

3. See, e.g., Rawls 1971, Scanlon 1998, Dworkin 1986, Ackerman 1980, Reiman 1990, and Barry 1989.

4. There seems to be a sharp contrast between the role that forgiveness of offenders may properly play in our personal lives, and the narrow or even nonexistent role it ought to play in a punishment system under law. Deserved mercy, apart from being an oxymoron, may have a role to play in the latter, but it is not the same thing as deserving to be forgiven or deserving to be excused.