Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
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Trinity

First published Thu Jul 23, 2009

The traditional Christian doctrine of the Trinity is commonly expressed as the claim that the one God “exists as” Father, Son, and Holy Spirit, or as the claim that there are three divine persons “in” God, or as the claim that God “exists in three Persons”. In theological contexts, there are two central formulas. The first is that the Father, Son, and Spirit are consubstantial (i.e., the same in substance or essence, Greek: homoousios). The second is that the Christian God is three “persons” (Greek: hypostaseis or prosopa, Latin: personae) in one “essence” or “being” (Greek: ousia, Latin: substantia or essentia). Both formulas have been understood in many ways.

After their formulation in the fourth century, the above formulas reigned unchallenged, and were widely assumed as basis for Christian theorizing about God. From the Reformation through the 19th century, the origin, meaning, and justification of the trinitarian doctrine were repeatedly disputed. These debates are discussed in detail in supplementary documents to the present entry. Since the revival of analytic philosophy of religion in the 1960s, many Christian philosophers have pursued philosophical theology, in which central Christian doctrines are given precise (and, it is hoped, defensible) formulations. This article surveys these formulations and the recent scholarly disputes concerning them. The fundamental issue is what is distinctive in the Christian conception of God, as opposed to the gods of other monotheistic religions.

Additional material related to this entry can be found in three supplementary documents:

1. Modalism

Although trinitarianism is by definition supposed to be monotheistic, it may seem to present not one god but three (Father, Son, and Holy Spirit) or even four (the preceding three, and also God or the Trinity as a whole). One way around this problem is to take one or more of the aforementioned as being numerically identical to the one God, and say that the others are not further gods, but only “modes” of it—roughly, ways that the one God is. We here use “modalism” as a term for any such view. (In theology “modalism” used as a label for a heretical theory described below, but as used here the term implies neither heresy nor orthodoxy.) While modalism hasn't been explicitly defended in recent analytic philosophical theology, it haunts many recent discussions of the Trinity by philosophers and theologians, and seems important to non-philosophical thinking about the Trinity. Hence, it is here analyzed.

Any kind of modalism must specify what is a mode of what, as well as make clear what a “mode” is. Nor need the modalist declare all the remaining god-candidates to be distinct modes; rather, two or more may be identified with each other.

Carried to an extreme, one may be a modalist without saying that any of the four are modes. This sort of modalist simply identifies God, the Father, the Son, and the Holy Spirit. Though some may hold this view, it is multiply inconsistent with itself, for any Christian will hold that some things are true of each that aren't true of the others (e.g., being tri-personal, being sent by the Father and Son to empower believers, being crucified, being the source of the Son and Spirit). Hence, it can't also be held that the four are numerically one, since nothing can differ from itself.

Since a main motivation of modalist trinitarianism is the preservation of monotheism, God—the god Yahweh of the Hebrew Scriptures—is normally chosen as primary, although one or more the other three may be held to be numerically identical to him. Although other combinations are logically possible, the contours of the New Testament have caused mainly the following forms of modalism to be seriously entertained (we discuss a third, which holds that only the Holy Spirit is a mode, at the end of this section).

What these modalists hold in common is the conviction that each of the above four terms refers to one and the same entity, either directly, or indirectly, by indicating one of its modes. (e.g., Talk of the Son is talk about God, either because the Son just is God, or because the Son is God living in a certain way.) But, what is a “mode”? It is a “way a thing is”, but that might mean several things. A “mode of X” might be

The last of these seems to be what is usually meant. (E.g., The Son is the event of God's relating to us as friend and savior. Or the Son is the event of God's taking on flesh and living and dying to reveal the Father to humankind. Or the Son is the eternal event or state of affairs of God's living and relating to himself in a son-like way.) If an event is (in the simplest case) a substance (thing) having a property (or a relation) at a time, then the Son (etc.) will be identified with God's having a certain property, or being in a certain relation, at a time (or timelessly). By a natural slide of thought (or language), the Son (etc.) may just be thought (spoken) of as a certain divine property, rather than God's having of it (e.g., God's wisdom).

Modes may be essential to the thing or not; a mode may be something a thing could exist without, or something which it must always have so long as it exists. (Or on another way to understand the essential/non-essential distinction, a mode may belong to a thing's definition or not.)

There are three ways these modes of a eternal being may be temporally related to one another: maximally overlapping, non-overlapping, or partially overlapping. First, they may be eternally concurrent—such that this being always, or timelessly, simultaneously has all of them. Second, they may be strictly sequential (non-overlapping): first the being has only one, then only another, then only another. Finally, some of the modes may be had at the same times; collectively, they may be partially overlapping.

Mainstream Christian theologians nearly always reject “modalism”, but by this they usually mean a theory like that of Sabellius (fl. 220) who is commonly interpreted as saying that the Father, Son, and Holy Spirit are sequential, non-essential modes, something like ways God interacts with his creation. Thus, in one epoch, God exists in the mode of Father, during the first century he exists as Son, and then after Christ's resurrection and ascension, he exists as Holy Spirit (Leftow 2004, 327; McGrath 2007, 254–5; Pelikan 1971, 179). Sabellian modalism is usually rejected on the grounds that such modes are strictly sequential, or because they are not intrinsic features of God, or because they are intrinsic but not essential features of God. The first aspect of Sabellian modalism conflicts with episodes in the New Testament where the three are mentioned as acting simultaneously, such as the Baptism of Jesus in Matthew 3:16–7. The last two are widely held to be objectionable because it is held that a doctrine of the Trinity should tell us about how God really is, not merely about how God appears, or because a trinitarian doctrine should be express (some of) God's essence. Sabellian and other ancient modalists are sometimes called “monarchians” because they upheld the sole monarchy of the Father, or “patripassians” for their (alleged) acceptance of the view that the Father (and not only the Son) suffered in the life of the man Jesus.

While Sabellian modalism was rejected for the reasons above, it is less clear why other kinds of modalism should be rejected. Suppose one holds that the Three are so many modes of God, i.e., God's eternally having certain intrinsic and essential features. Sometimes the Trinity doctrine is expounded by theologians as meaning just this, the creedal formulas being interpreted as asserting that God (non-contingently) acts as Creator, Redeemer, and Comforter, or describing “God as transcendent abyss, God as particular yet unbounded intelligence, and God as the immanent creative energy of being… three distinct ways of being God”, with the named modes being intrinsic and essential to God, and not mere ways that God appears (Ward 2002, 236; cf. Ward 2000, 90).

Such claims, however, may conflict with other things most Christians want to say about God. If God exists necessarily and is essentially the creator and the redeemer of created beings in need of salvation, this implies it is not possible for there to be no creation, or for there to be no fallen creatures; God could not have avoided creating beings in need of redemption. Modalists may get around this by more carefully specifying the properties in question: not creator but creator of anything else there might be, and not redeemer but redeemer of any creatures in need of salvation there might be and which he should want to save.

It may be objected that any kind of modalism which makes the Father and/or the Son a mode of God is hard to square with the New Testament, where the Father and Son are represented as enjoying a close, loving personal relationship, and where the Son mediates between God and humankind. These teachings arguably assume the Son to be a person, a self, and not a mere mode of a self. (See section 3 below.) Modalism about the Son seems to reduce this personal relationship to God's “interacting” with himself, or to something like a “friendship” between the multiple personalities of a victim of multiple personality disorder.

One may counter this sort of objection with a metaphysics according to which every person (self), or at least every divine or non-bodily person, is a mode of a non-person. On some theories, all substances or all individuals (or all those other than God) are to be understood as modes. These possibilities, envisioned by 17th century philosophers, have not been carefully applied or adapted to modalist Trinity theories by theologians. A difficulty with moves like this would be that the more a “mode” amounts to, the less the resulting modalism about the Trinity looks like monotheism. For example, if one says that the Son and Holy Spirit are modes of God, but are also personal substances, it looks like God will be a compound entity, with other gods (or divine persons) as parts, which runs strongly counter to the mainstream, pro-Nicene tradition. (See section 3.3 of the supplementary document on the history of trinitarian doctrines.) In sum, “thin” modes saddle a trinitarian modalist with the biblical difficulties noted above, whereas metaphysically “thick” modes seem to run afoul of the doctrine of divine simplicity, or even monotheism.

Most 17th-19th century unitarians, present-day “biblical unitarians”, and some current subordinationists such as the Jehovah's Witness sect hold the Holy Spirit to be a mode of God—God's power, presence, or action in the world. (See the supplementary document on unitarianism.) Not implying modalism about the Son, this position is harder to refute on New Testament grounds, although mainstream theologians and some subordinationist unitarians reject it as inconsistent with New Testament language from which we should infer that the Holy Spirit is (in some sense) a full-fledged person (Clarke 1738, 147). These groups counter with other biblical language which suggests that the “Spirit of God” or “Holy Spirit” refers to either God himself, a mode of God (e.g., his power), or an effect of a mode of God (e.g., supernatural human abilities such as healing). (See Burnap 1845, 226–52; Lardner 1793, 79–174; Wilson 1846, 325–32.) This exegetical debate is difficult, as all natural languages allow persons to be described in mode-terms (“Hillary is Bill's strength.”) and modes to be described in language which literally applies only to persons. (“God's wisdom told him not to create beer-sap trees.”)

At the popular level, modalist thinking has a firm beachhead; liturgical statements, song lyrics, and sermons frequently use trinitarian names (“Father”, “Son”, “Jesus”, “God”, etc.) as if they were interchangeable, co-referring terms, referring directly or indirectly (via a mode) to one and the same thing.

Among large Christian groups, only the theology of the United Pentecostal Church (a.k.a. “Oneness” Pentecostals), is explicitly modalistic; the Three are either identified with God himself, or with aspects or actions of God.

2. Latin Trinitarianism

“Latin trinitarianism” is a recent label, coined to signify the stream of trinitarian thinking prominent in the Latin-speaking Western church of the late classical and medieval periods. It is most often used by those drawing a contrast between this body of thought, and “social trinitarian” thought. A very rough first approach to the difference between these schools, is: Latin trinitarianism starts with the oneness of God and tries to show how God is three, while social trinitarianism starts with the way in which God is three and tries to show how God is nonetheless one. This recent terminology can mislead though. “Latin trinitarianism” is just what would have been thought of as the creedal teaching about the Three for most of Christian history, or at least a prominent strand of it, another being mysterianism, which is often thought compatible with it. This “Latin” family of theories is here understood as a less prominently mysterian and more metaphysical part of or outgrowth of the pro-Nicene movement. (See section 4 below and section 3.3 of the supplementary document on the history of trinitarian doctrines.)

What Latin theories have in common is their (1) affirmation of the doctrine implied in the Constantinopolitan Creed that Father, Son, and Holy Spirit are homoousios (see supplementary document on the history of trinitarian doctrines section 3.2), and (2) their denial that this amounts to three numerically distinct things, each of which is divine. That is, they deny that the three are “the same substance” merely in the sense in which three humans are, i.e., each equally instantiates the same universal nature. As they aim to be monotheistic, each variant of this approach has a unique way of undercutting the inference from three divine persons to tritheism.

2.1 Divine Life Stream Theories

We now turn to some recent “Latin” theories. (For historical theories by which these were inspired, see the supplementary document on the history of trinitarian doctrines, section 3.3.2, on Augustine, and section 4.1, on Thomas Aquinas.)

Brian Leftow sets the agenda for his own Latin theory in an attack on “social” theories. (See section 3 below.)

In [Latin trinitarianism], there is just one divine being (or substance), God….[As Thomas Aquinas says,] God begotten receives numerically the same nature God begetting has. To make Aquinas' claim perfectly plain, I introduce a technical term, “trope”. Abel and Cain were both human. So they had the same nature, humanity. Yet each also had his own nature, and Cain's humanity was not identical with Abel's… A trope is an individualized case of an attribute. Their bearers individuate tropes: Cain's humanity is distinct from Abel's just because it is Cain's, not Abel's. With this term in hand, I now restate Aquinas' claim: while Father and Son instance the divine nature (deity), they have but one trope of deity between them, which is God's….bearers individuate tropes. If the Father's deity is God's, this is because the Father just is God. (1999, 203–4, original emphasis)

In a later piece, Leftow makes clear that Latin trinitarianism needn't commit to trope theory about properties. Rather, whether or not properties are tropes,

…the Father's having deity = [is numerically or absolutely identical to] the Son's having deity. For both are at bottom just God's having deity. (Leftow 2007, 358, original emphasis)

At first glance, these statements seem to simply identify the persons of the Trinity and God; it is the extreme kind of modalism that holds “Father”, “Son”, “Holy Spirit”, and “God” to be four names for one and the same entity. On the other hand, in some places Leftow seems to hold that the three persons are so many modes of God. Well aware of this problem, Leftow tries to to clarify his theory, to show why it doesn't amount to any undesirable form of modalism.

In arguing that it isn't obviously impossible for God to be a (Latin) Trinity, Leftow makes an extended analogy with time travel; just as a dancer may repeatedly time travel back to the dance stage, resulting in a whole chorus line of dancers, each of which is a “stage” in the life of that one dancer, so God may eternally live his life in three “streams” or “strands” (Leftow 2004, 312–23). Each person-constituting “strand” of God's life is supposed to (in some sense) count as a “complete” life (although for any one of the three, there's more to God's life than it) (Leftow 2004, 312). Leftow also thinks that just as the many stages of the time-traveling dancer's life are united into stages of her by their being causally connected in the right way, so too, analogously, the lives of each of the three Persons count as being the “strands of” the life of God, because of the mysterious but somehow causal inter-trinitarian relations (the Father generating Son, and the Father and Son spirating the Spirit) (313–4, cf. 321–2).

The Persons simply are God as in certain acts—certain events—in His inner life….none [of these events] are in time….God just eternally does the acts which constitute His life; these acts render Him triune. (316, original emphasis)

Leftow argues that his theory isn't any undesirable form of modalism because

Nothing in my account of the Trinity precludes saying that the Persons' distinction is an eternal, necessary, non-successive and intrinsic feature of God's life, one which would be there even if there were no creatures. (Leftow 2004, 327)

While Leftow is trying to develop a positive account of the Trinity, he also wants to show what is wrong with the following argument (2004, 305–6; cf. 2007, 359):

  1. the Father = God
  2. the Son = God
  3. God = God
  4. the Father = the Son (from 1–3)
  5. the Father generates the Son
  6. God generates God (from 1, 2, 5).

His point is that creedal orthodoxy requires 1–3 and 5, yet 1–3 imply the unorthodox 4, and 1, 2 and 5 imply the unorthodox (and necessarily false) statement 6. So what to do? Leftow suggests the above argument misrepresents Christian orthodoxy; properly understood, 4 doesn't follow from 1–3, and 6 doesn't really follow from 1, 2 and 5. In Leftow's view, 1–6 above are properly understood as:

  1. God, in and only in strand 1 of his life, lives in a Fatherly way.
  2. God, in and only in strand 2 of his life, lives in a Son-like manner.
  3. (From the standpoint of any one or more strands of his life,) God just is God (is self-identical).
  4. Strand 1 of God's life (the Fatherly one) just is (=) strand 2 of God's life (the Son-like one).
  5. There's a timeless “generation” relation between strand 1 of God's life, and strand 2 of his life.
  6. (From the standpoint of any one or more strands of his life,) God generates God.

(Even if we don't alter 3 or 5, if we simply analyze 1 and 2 as Leftow suggests, the argument is invalid.) We thus “index Trinitarian truths to appropriate sets of events” [i.e., those sets composing God's various life-streams] (2004, 326), thereby showing antitrinitarian arguments to be invalid. Certainly, Leftow is correct in thinking that the argument just quoted is invalid. His justification for reading the problematic argument as above, though, is controversial. He argues that just as with time-bound things, there are “temporary identities”, so with God identity statements must be relativized to something time-like, namely the various “strands” of his life (2004, 323–6; 2007, 370–3). In a later piece, Leftow adapts John Locke's thought experiments about personal identity to support the point that for all we know the “persons” of the Trinity are “event-based persons”, that is, subjects of experience who exist because of certain events or processes in God. Certain “parts of [God's] life… are identical with the lives of the three Persons” (Leftow 2007, 374–5).

Leftow's theory hasn't received substantial criticism in the literature, but possible lines of objection would include that he's trying to illuminate the obscure (the Latin Trinity) by the obscure (the alleged possibility of time travel, and timeless analogues to it). Again, it might be objected that his theory is an objectionable modalism after all, namely the view that the three “persons” are so many intrinsic, entirely-overlapping, eternal, essential modes of the one God, something like God's manners of living. (See section 1 above.) He might reply that it hasn't been shown why a mode of a substance can't also be a substance and a subject of experience.

2.2 Relative Identity Theories

One may think that a trinitarian doctrine inconsistently identifies both the Son and the Father with God, but not with each other. A number of recent Christian philosophers have suggested that the problem isn't with the doctrine, but rather with the absolute concept of identity, or with its application to the trinitarian doctrine. With great precision and creativity, they interpret trinitarian doctrines as involving not identity, but some weaker relation. Following Rea (2003) we divide these into pure and impure relative identity trinitarian theories.

2.2.1 Pure Relative Identity Theories

Peter Geach (1972, 1973, 1980) argues that it is senseless to ask whether or not some a and b are “the same”; rather, sameness is relative to a sortal concept. Thus, while it is senseless to ask whether or not Paul and Saul are identical, we can ask whether or not Saul and Paul are the same human, same person, same apostle, same animal, etc. The doctrine of the Trinity, then, is construed as the claim that the Father, Son, and Holy Spirit are the same God, but are not the same person. They are “God-identical but Person-distinct” (Rea 2003, 432). The resulting trinitarian theory avoids the inconsistencies mentioned above. Geach's approach to the Trinity is developed by Martinich (1978, 1979) and Cain (1989).

This sort of relative identity trinitarianism, however, depends on the very controversial claim that there's no such relation as (non-sortal-relative, absolute) identity. Most philosophers hold, to the contrary, that the identity relation and its logic are well-understood. One might turn to a weaker relative identity doctrine; outside the context of the Trinity, philosopher Nicholas Griffin (1977; cf. Rea 2003, 435–6) has argued that while there are identity relations, they are not basic, but must be understood in terms of relative identity relations. On either view, relative identity relations are fundamental.

It has been objected to Geach's claim about the senselessness of asking if a and b are “the same” that,

Given that we have succeeded in picking out something by the use of “a” and in picking out something by the use of “b” it surely is a complete determinate proposition that a = b, that is, it is surely either true or false that the item we have picked out with “a” is the item we have picked out with “b”. (Alston and Bennett 1984, 558)

Rea also objects that relative identity theory presupposes some sort of metaphysical anti-realism, the controversial doctrine that there is no realm of real objects which exists independently of human thought (Rea 2003, 435–6).

Trenton Merricks objects that if a and b “are the same F”, this implies that a is an F, that b is an F, and that a and b are (absolutely, non-relatively) identical. But this is precisely what relative identity trinitarians deny, and this denial leads to the resulting relative-identity trinitarian claims being unintelligible (we have no grasp of what they mean). If someone asserts that Fluffy and Spike are “the same dog” and denies that they're both dogs, and that they're one and the same, we have no idea what this person is asserting. Similarly with the claim that Father and Son are “the same God” but are not identical (Merricks 2006, 301–5, 321; cf. Tuggy 2003, 173–4).

One may also object to either theory being an analysis of the orthodox doctrine, on the grounds that only those conversant in the logic of the last 120 years or so have ever had a concept of relative identity. This may be disputed—Anscombe and Geach (1961, 118) argue that Aquinas should be read along these lines, and Richard Cartwright (1987, 193) claims to find the doctrine in the works of Anselm and in the Eleventh Council of Toledo (675). (See supplementary document on the history of trinitarian doctrines section 4.)

2.2.2 Impure Relative Identity Theories

Peter van Inwagen (1995, 2003) tries to show that there is a set of propositions representing a possibly orthodox interpretation of the “Athanasian” creed which is demonstrably self-consistent, refuting claims that the doctrine is obviously self-contradictory. He formulates a trinitarian doctrine using a concept of relative identity, without employing the concept of identity or presupposing that there is or isn't such a thing (van Inwagen 1995, 241). Specifically, he proves that the following eight claims (understood as involving relative and never absolute identity, the names being read as descriptions) don't imply a contradiction in relative identity logic.

Van Inwagen neither endorses this trinitarianism, nor presumes to pronounce it orthodox, and he admits that it does little to reduce the mysteriousness of the Trinity.

It may be objected, as to the preceding theory, that van Inwagen's relative identity trinitarianism is unintelligible. Merricks argues that this problem is more acute for van Inwagen than for Geach, as the former declines to adopt Geach's claim that all assertions of identity, in all domains of discourse, and in everyday life, are sortal-relative (Merricks 2006, 302–4).

Michael Rea (2003) objects that by remaining neutral on the issue of identity, van Inwagen's theory allows that the three persons are (absolutely) non-identical, in which case “it is hard to see what it could possibly mean to say that they are the same being…” (Rea 2003, 441) It seems that any things which are non-identical are not the same being. Thus, van Inwagen must assume that there is absolute identity, and deny that this relation holds between, say, Father and Son. Thus, van Inwagen has not demonstrated the consistency of (this version of) trinitarianism, and just as disturbingly, his theory doesn't rule out polytheism, as it doesn't deny that there are non-identical divine beings. In sum, the impure relative identity trinitarian must be able to tell a plausible and orthodox metaphysical story about how non-identical beings may nonetheless be “one God”, and van Inwagen hasn't done this, staying as he has in the realm of logic (Rea 2003, 441–2).

In a later discussion (van Inwagen 2003), van Inwagen goes farther, claiming that trinitarian doctrine is inconsistent “if the standard logic of identity is correct”, and denying there is any “relation that is both universally reflexive [i.e., everything bears the relation to itself] and forces indiscernibility [i.e., things standing in the relation can't differ].” (92) Thus, there's no such relation as classical or absolute identity, but there are instead only various relative identity relations (92–3). Many philosophers would object that whatever reason there is to believe in the Trinity, it is more obvious that there's such a relation as identity, that Leibniz's Law is true, and that we do use singular referring terms.

Rea claims to possess the sort of metaphysical story van Inwagen's theory lacks. Rea and Jeffrey Brower develop a trinitarian theory according to which each of the divine persons is non-identical to the others, as well as to God, but is nonetheless “numerically the same” as all of them (Brower and Rea 2005a). They develop an analogy between the Christian God and material objects. When we look at a bronze statue of Athena, they urge, we should say that we're viewing one material object. Yet, we can distinguish the lump of bronze from the statue. These cannot be identical, as they differ (e.g., the lump could, but the statue couldn't survive being smashed flat). We should say that the lump and statue stand in a relation of “accidental sameness”. This means that they needn't be, but in fact are “numerically the same” without being identical. While they are numerically one physical object, they are two hylomorphic compounds, that is, two compounds of form and matter, sharing their matter. Similarly, they suggest, the persons of the Trinity are constituted by the same stuff (or something analogous to a stuff), albeit an immaterial stuff, which they call “the divine essence”. They, like the lump and statue, are numerically the same without being identical, but they don't stand in a relation of accidental sameness, as presumably they could not fail to be related in this way. While they are three different hylomorphic (matter-form) compounds (consisting of that divine essence plus one of: fatherhood, sonship, spirithood), and are three divine persons, they are to be counted as one God. They don't posit “matter” as an additional thing, but only as a sort of ingredient or component of the one God, and of the three persons (Brower and Rea 2005a, 60, 68). This avoids the problem of saying that God is a fourth thing. Brower and Rea argue that their theory stands a better chance of being orthodox than its competitors, and point out that a part of their motivation is that Augustine, Anselm, and Aquinas say things which seem to require a concept of numerical sameness without identity. (See supplementary document on the history of Trinity theories, sections 3.3.2, on Augustine, and 4.1, on Thomas Aquinas.)

William Lane Craig criticizes the Brower and Rea theory on several grounds (Craig 2005). First, is talk of “immaterial stuff” intelligible at all? Second, is it really orthodox? As we saw above, central parts of the medieval tradition considered God to lack matter, but rather to be form only, or “pure act”. Further, it was maintained that God is simple, without parts or components of any kind, not a thing analyzable into form and (something like?) matter. Third, while Athena and the bronze statue differ in some properties, so long as the latter constitutes the former, they must share others, such as mass, location, and shape. But the persons of the Trinity simultaneously differ in intrinsic properties. And the Son may truly say “I was crucified nearly 2000 years ago”, but the Father may not (Craig 2005, 82–3). Again, the Son is asserted by traditional theology to enjoy a “hypostatic union” with a complete human nature, but the Father does not. If the Son is the same God as the Father, this seems analogous to the apparently contradictory claim that at one time Michelangelo's David statue and the Venus de Milo share all their matter and are one object (Craig 2005, 83). In sum, it is not clear that their approach delivers a consistent theory of the Trinity.

On their theory the term “God” (“Yahweh”, etc.) is ambiguous; in circumstances where no factor singles out one of the three, one who uses a sentence with the term “God” fails to express a proposition. To see this, return to the statue example. Suppose one points at the Athena statue and says “That material object has been around for three thousand years.” Brower and Rea hold that even though there is truly one material object at which you're pointing, the term “That material object” is ambiguous, as it may refer to either the lump of bronze or to the statue. It would matter for the truth or falsity of what you said; suppose the statue is only two thousand years old, while the lump is three thousand. Here the circumstances will likely fix the reference of the term (e.g., one is in a discussion about statues). It is hard to see, though, what would disambiguate certain statements not made in a trinitarian context, for example, “In Yahweh I have found refuge” (Psalm 11:1) or “God created the world.” Does their theory imply that David and Moses failed to assert anything that could be true or false, due to their use of ambiguous terms?

Another line of objection stems from the fact that they only claim to offer a limited analogy of the Trinity—their basic idea is that there is something somewhat like a shared matter in the Trinity, which bears something like a material constitution relation to each of the persons. In line with the pro-Nicene tradition, while embracing the material constitution analogy as the most accurate, they also give the analogies of three men, a person with multiple personality disorder, and commissurotomy patients who seem to exhibit two “spheres of consciousness”, praising each of these as somewhat “fruitful” and to some degree illuminating (Brower and Rea 2005b). One may view this as either an advantage (from the standpoint of the pro-Nicene tradition) or as a disadvantage (as it doesn't offer a literal metaphysical model).

3. Social Trinitarianism

3.1 20th Century Theologians

Much twentieth century theological literature on the Trinity derives from the influential work of theologians Karl Barth (1886–1968) and Karl Rahner (1904–84), both of whom endorse Trinity theories widely criticized as modalist or close to it. Both suggest jettisoning the traditional term “person” for what God is three of, suggesting the replacements “modes of being” (Barth) or “manners of subsisting” (Rahner). (See Letham 2004, 279; Pugliese 2003, 239.) The second half of the twentieth century saw a backlash against this tendency. In numerous sources, Western or Latin theology was blamed for “overemphasizing the oneness” of God, and balance was sought by looking to Eastern theology, which was credited with either emphasizing or overemphasizing the threeness of God. A number of concerns characterize theologians in this 20th and 21st century movement of social trinitarianism:

(For surveys of this literature see Kärkkäinen 2007; Olson and Hall 2002, 95–115; Peters 1993, 103–45.) Writers in this genre are unclear about what metaphysics of the Christian God they're endorsing. The views seem to range from tritheism, to the idea that the Trinity is an event, to something that differs only slightly, or only in emphasis, from pro-Nicene (see section 3.3 of the supplementary document on the history of trinitarian doctrines) or Latin theories. Merricks insightfully remarks that some views advertised as “social trinitarianism” make it “sound equivalent to the thesis the the Doctrine of the Trinity is true but modalism is false” (Merricks 2006, 306). However, a number of Christian philosophers, and some theologians employing the methods of analytic philosophy, have taken a starting point in this literature and developed clear, full-blown Trinity theories, which are surveyed here. We follow a four-fold classification which sorts them by how they claim to secure monotheism (Leftow 1999).

3.2 Functional Monotheist Social Trinitarianism

A social trinitarian may argue that the Father, Son, and Holy Spirit are one God because of how they function—how they related to each other, and to everything else. The best developed theory like this is by Richard Swinburne, who argues that it is uncharitable to read the ecumenical councils' claim that “there is only one god” as asserting that there's only one divine individual, as that would contradict their commitment to there being three divine individuals. He suggests that they should be read as “denying that there were three independent divine beings, any one of which could exist without the other; or which could act independently of each other” (Swinburne 1994, 180). He holds that each of the three “is God” in the sense that each possesses all the divine attributes. He summarizes his trinitarian theory as follows.

…the three divine individuals taken together would form a collective source of the being of all other things; the members would be totally mutually dependent and necessarily jointly behind each other's acts. This collective [i.e., the Christian God] would be indivisible in its being for logical reasons—that is, the kind of being that it would be is such that each of its members is necessarily everlasting, and would not have existed unless it had brought about or been brought about by the others. The collective would also be indivisible in its causal action in the sense that each would back totally the causal action of the others. The collective would be causeless and so (in my sense), unlike its members, ontologically necessary, not dependent for its existence on anything outside itself. It is they, however, rather than it, who, to speak strictly, would have the divine properties of omnipotence, omniscience, etc…. Similarly this very strong unity of the collective would make it, as well as its individual members, an appropriate object of worship. (1994, 180–1)

As he understands the concept of substance, the Trinity, referred to above as “the collective”, is a substance, one with divine substances as parts, but is not itself a divine substance or person. He hastens to add, though, that by a natural extension of use we may say of the Trinity what we say of the persons, e.g., that it is all-powerful, all-knowing, etc. (9–13, 181).

For Swinburne an “ontologically necessary” substance is one which exists everlastingly with no active or permissive cause for its existence. A “metaphysically necessary” substance is one which is either ontologically necessary or such that it everlastingly exists, and at least the start of its existence is due to the inevitable action of some other being which is uncaused and everlasting (118, 146). He rejects the view, popular among theists, that a divine being must be a se (i.e., must exist through or because of itself) in the sense of ontological necessity, arguing that it is simpler and more reasonable to attribute only metaphysical necessity to them (118–21, 170–80). In his view, each of the Father, Son, and Holy Spirit is metaphysically necessary, as the Father is the active cause of the Son, and the Father and Son together actively co-cause the Spirit. (He remains neutral about whether this active causation is eternal or only for the first portion of the Son's and of the Spirit's existence, and he seems not to regard co-causing as involving causal overdetermination.) Each of the three, being omnipotent, must also be a permissive cause of the existence of each of the other two. The following chart illustrates how the persons of the Trinity are related to one another in Swinburne's theory. The black arrows represent active causation, and the gray arrows represent permissive causation.

A representation of how the members of the Trinity are related on Swinburne's functional monotheist social trinitarianism

The Father has a kind of priority, and this gives him authority to lay down some rules which when agreed to will prevent the wills of these three omnipotent beings from ever clashing (171–5). In sum, the Trinity is a tightly unified complex thing with three divine beings as parts, which necessarily acts much as a single personal being would. It is a whole, which is, in a sense, reducible to the sum of its parts; the entire set of truths about the Father, Son, and Holy Spirit could in principle be stated without mentioning this collective or composite which is the Trinity (10, 13).

Swinburne believes it can be shown probable that a god exists, and he also argues that “the most probable kind of God is such that inevitably he becomes tripersonal” (1994, 191). More precisely, he argues that if it is possible for there to be more than one divine person, there will of necessity be exactly three. A divine person, he argues, being all-knowing and perfectly good, will recognize the supreme value of love.

Love involves sharing, giving to the other what of one's own is good for him and receiving from the other what of his is good for one; and love involves co-operating with another to benefit third parties. (177)

Inevitably, then, the first divine being will produce another, then inevitably cooperate with that being to produce a third, and also inevitably, each of the three will freely allow the other two to continue to exist (being divine and thus omnipotent and perfectly free, each must freely give his permission if anything else is to exist). Thereafter, inevitably, each being will cooperate in whatever either of the others does. Why not a fourth? No qualitative difference in the loving would result therefrom, or at least not a difference that would bring about a over-riding reason for anyone to create a fourth, and so no divine being would, by its essential nature, inevitably bring about a fourth (etc.). And a divine being can't be created by an act of will (rather than an act of essence), as this would imply that it could possibly not exist, which is incompatible with its being divine (177–9).

In a sympathetic but penetrating critique, William Alston highlights some difficulties for the above theory stemming from Swinburne's ideas of metaphysical and ontological necessity. First, Alston says, “I can find no reason, or even motivation, for Swinburne's making ontological necessity one of the ways of being metaphysically necessary” (Alston 1997, 41). One might even say that the theory is arbitrarily rigged so that may say of both the Trinity and each of the persons, that they are all “necessary”. Alston worries that this in fact represents “a considerable weakening of the unity of the divine nature”, as it has been bought cheaply with a disjunctive definition (53). Second, while Swinburne wants to say that an ontologically necessary being and a (merely) metaphysically necessary being are “equally ultimate”, it seems that the former would be more ultimate. And while both sorts of being are supposed to exist inevitably, a (merely) metaphysically necessary being won't, unless its cause's existence and causal action are also necessary. (42–3) Third, more seriously, on Swinburne's definition, none of the three persons of the Trinity (contrary to his intention) is metaphysically necessary, for none is ontologically necessary, and none is caused by an uncaused individual, as each has two permissive causes, namely, the other two persons of the Trinity (Alston 1997, 42–9). Based on conversations with Swinburne, Alston suggests that to satisfy his theoretical aims, Swinburne needs the following revised definition:

A substance S1 is metaphysically necessary if either (1) it is ontologically necessary, or (2) it is everlasting and has no active cause of its existence throughout some first (beginningless) period of time, or (3) it is everlasting and is (directly or indirectly actively caused to exist through some first (beginningless) period of time by a cause whose backwardly everlasting existence has no active cause, inevitably so in virtue of its properties. And any cause of the existence of a type (2) or type (3) being at any time is either (a) one whose backwardly everlasting existence has no active cause, or (b) one of which any cause either has no active cause for its backwardly everlasting existence or is such that none of its causes has any active cause for its backwardly everlasting existence, or… (51, original emphases)

Thus, the special priority of the Father is preserved, in that but for his action, the other two wouldn't exist, whereas his existence doesn't depend on any being's causal activity (52). As to the charge of tritheism, Alston opines that “Swinburne embraces a fairly straightforward form of tritheism” (55). He adds however, that anyone seeking to make the doctrine intelligible, is inevitably going to tilt towards either modalism or tritheism. He suggests that Swinburne's real error lies in his attempt to make the doctrine intelligible at all, which robs the doctrine of its mystery, turning it into “something that any bright philosophy or theology student can clearly grasp here and now”, rather than something that will be understood only “when we see the Triune God face to face” (56; cf. Alston 2005). (See also section 4 below.)

Other critics have been less sympathetic. Brian Leftow objects that in Swinburne's account God is not itself divine. Nor does it makes sense to worship it, as it is not the sort of thing which can be aware of our addressing it. Further, the issue of monotheism isn't the issue of how unified the divine beings are, but rather of how many. And it stretches credibility to interpret the creed's claim that the Father, Son, and Holy Spirit are “one God” to tell us how the three divine beings act. Rather, three persons are numbered in the creeds, but they are said to be only one God. Moreover,

…it is hardly plausible that Greek paganism would have been a form of monotheism had Zeus & Co. been more alike, better behaved, and linked by the right causal connections. (Leftow 1999, 232; cf. Rea 2006)

Moreover, if Swinburne were right, it would be coherent to suppose that both monotheism were true, and that there were an infinity of gods. But that is not coherent (233–4). While one might argue that gods who necessarily act in a unified manner would give us all we care about in monotheism, Leftow argues that this isn't so, as the Bible asserts the existence of precisely one god (235–6). Swinburne's theory entails serious inequalities of power among the Three, jeopardizes the personhood of each, and carries the serious price of allowing (contrary to most theists) that a divine being may be created, and the possibility of more than one divine being (236–40). Using familial analogies, Leftow challenges Swinburne's claim that the Three would lack an overriding reason to produce a fourth, noting that “Cooperating with two to love yet another is a greater ”balancing act“ than cooperating with one to love yet another” (241).

Kelly Clark criticizes Swinburne's theory on four main counts. First, the reasons given for affirming metaphysical rather than ontological necessity of divine beings are unconvincing (Clark 1996, 465–7, 474). Second, the omniscience and omnipotence of the three divine persons would necessarily prevent any clash of wills, rendering Swinburne's postulation of a kind of governing authority exercised by the Father unnecessary (467–70). Third, his position is tritheism. Finally, his readings are not the overall best interpretations of the Nicene and “Athanasian” creeds (471–3).

Dale Tuggy objects that if this theory were true, it would seem that one or more members of the Trinity had wrongfully deceived us by leading us to falsely believe that there is only one divine person. He also argues that the New Testament writings assume that “God” and “the Father of Jesus” are (in all but a few cases) co-referring terms (i.e., God and the Father are assumed to be identical). Denying this last claim, he argues, amounts to an uncharitable and unreasonable attribution of a serious confusion to the New Testament writers and (if they're believed) to Jesus as well (Tuggy 2004).

3.3 Trinity Monotheist Social Trinitarianism

The Trinity monotheist holds there there is one God because there is one Trinity. The term “Trinity monotheism” originates with Leftow (1999, 209), and the best developed such theory is by J. P. Moreland and William Lane Craig, who embrace the label. (Moreland and Craig 2003, 575–96; Craig 2006) Unlike those in the pro-Nicene tradition, they aim to provide a literal model:

God is an immaterial substance or soul endowed with three sets of cognitive faculties each of which is sufficient for personhood, so that God has three centers of self-consciousness, intentionality, and will…. the persons are [each] divine… since the model describes a God who is tri-personal. The persons are the minds of God. (Craig 2006, 101)

Only the Trinity, on this theory, is an instance of the divine nature, as the divine nature includes the property of being triune; beyond the Trinity “there are no other instances of the divine nature” (2003, 590). So if “being divine” means “being identical with a divinity” (i.e., being a thing which instantiates the nature divinity), then none of the persons are “divine”. But they don't put it that way. They say that the Father, Son, and Holy Spirit are each “divine” in another sense. They compare the Trinity to the mythical three-headed dog Cerberus, arguing that just as this beast is one dog because it has one body, so the Father, Son, and Holy Spirit are one God because they are three centers of consciousness in one soul (2003, 393).

Daniel Howard-Snyder (2003) offers numerous objections, some of which are as follows. They can't avoid either polytheism or different levels of divinity, either of which would make their theory (contrary to their intentions) unorthodox. The Cerberus analogy is criticized on the grounds that it would be not one dog with three minds, but rather, three dogs with overlapping bodies. They uphold (with the creeds) one divine substance, and yet by their own criteria each of the three persons must be a substance as well, and they hold that each person is divine. Thus, they seem saddled with polytheism. (393–5) In their view God is not a personal being, in the sense of being numerically identical with a certain personal being, even though it (God) has parts which are persons. They want to say, for example, that each of the three is all-knowing, and they also want to say God is all-knowing, in that he has parts which are all-knowing. But Howard-Snyder objects that,

…there can be no “lending” of a property [i.e., a whole “getting” a property from one of its parts] unless the borrower is antecedently the sort of thing that can have it….[Therefore,] Unless God is antecedently the sort of thing that can act intentionally—that is, unless God is a person—God cannot borrow the property of creating the heavens and the earth from the Son….All other [statements involving] acts attributed to God [in the Bible] will likewise turn out to be, strictly and literally, false. (399–400)

In their view, a thing (God) can exemplify the divine nature without itself being a (identical to) a person. Nor can divinity include properties which require being a person, e.g., being all-knowing, being perfectly free. This, he argues, is “an abysmally low” view of the divine nature, as “If God is not a person or agent, then God does not know anything, cannot act, cannot choose, cannot be morally good, cannot be worthy of worship” (401).

Craig replies to Howard-Snyder's objection to the Cerberus analogy that the claim that it represents three dogs is “astonishing”, as we all normally speak of two headed snakes, turtles and such (Craig 2003, 102). True, in their view God isn't identical to any personal being. However, it doesn't follow that God isn't personal. He is personal, because he has personal parts, and moreover he's tripersonal. Further, the view that God isn't a person

is part and parcel of Trinitarian orthodoxy….Howard-Snyder assumes that God cannot have such properties [i.e., knowledge, choice, moral goodness, worship-worthiness] unless He is a person. But it seems to me that God can have them if God is a soul possessing the rational faculties sufficient for personhood. If God were a soul endowed with a single set of rational faculties, then He could do all these things. By being a more richly endowed soul, is God thereby somehow incapacitated? (105)

As to the charge of polytheism, he accuses Howard-Snyder of confusing monotheism with unitarianism (106). Finally, he argues that the issue of whether or not the Three count as parts of God is unimportant (107–13).

3.4 Perichoretic Monotheist Social Trinitarianism

Stephen T. Davis (1999, 2003, 2006) constructs a social trinitarian theory which in his view bridges or straddles the social-Latin divide. Like Swinburne, he gives a philosophical argument for there being more than one divine person. God must be perfect in love, which requires that he loves another. But it is possible that only God exists. Either social trinitarianism is true, or “there is no ‘other’ in the Godhead” (2006, 65). But there must be an “other” in the divine nature, therefore social trinitarianism is true (2006, 65–8; Davis 1999). Unlike Swinburne's argument, this one doesn't involve divine persons causing others to exist. Also, it is strictly speaking not an argument for social trinitarianism, as it only tries to prove that there is more than one thing capable of loving and being loved within the divine nature. (Davis 2006, 66–68)

Davis holds that there are three persons, conscious purposive agents, which are essentially and equally divine. None is a cause of any other. These three persons differ “primarily and pre-eminently in their relations to each other” (Davis 2006, 71). The Father “begets” the Son, and these two bear a different relation to the Spirit; but these relations are not causal, but only logical. Whatever any of the three persons does respecting the rest of reality, the other two in some sense do as well, and they are not capable of disagreeing. God is personal (God in some sense contains three persons) but isn't strictly speaking a person (Davis 2006, 69–71). God just is (identical to) the divine nature or godhead (2006, 75).

Why is this a form of monotheism rather than tritheism? Davis mentions their equally possessing the divine essence, and their inability to disagree, but for him the main factor is that the three enjoy the relation of perichoresis, which he expounds as meaning “co-inherence, mutual indwelling, interpenetrating, merging” (2006, 72). It has been objected that the concept of perichoresis is too unclear to help us see why three divine persons should be one God (Tuggy 2003, 170–1). Davis admits the unclarity, but appeals to the pro-Nicene tradition of giving admittedly inadequate analogies for the Trinity (2006, 72). (See section 3.3 in the supplementary document on the history of Trinity theories.) He invites us to imagine the contradictory situation of three circles being simultaneously in State 1 and in State 2 (2 representing them as “stacked” or circumscribing the same area).

Davis's State 1 and State 2

In State 2, we may truly say there are three circles, that there's one circle, or that there are three-in-one, but we may not say there are four (Davis 2006, 73). To the objection that this example is contradictory, he replies that he's not trying to give a consistent model of the Trinity, but only explicating the meaning of perichoresis. The Trinity is “at bottom mysterious” (73–4). Davis's theory may be best understood not as a blend of social and Latin trinitarianism, but rather as a blend of social trinitarianism and mysterianism. (See section 4 below.)

3.5 Group Mind Monotheist Social Trinitarianism

Leftow explores the answer, found in some twentieth century theologians, but not much defended in recent philosophical theology, that the three persons are one God because “the Trinity has or is a divine mind composed of the Persons' minds” (1999, 221). Some have suggested that for all we know, all human minds are group minds. As support, they appeal to commissurotomy patients who after their brain hemispheres are divided seem to act as if each half were itself a functioning mind. But then, perhaps, the normal human brain supports a group mind composed of the minds associated with each half.

Granting that it's possible for there to be group minds, Leftow argues that this concept will be no help to the social trinitarian. Thinking of a group mind as a fourth mind emerging from the three divine minds will result in too many divine minds (four). On the other hand, we might think of the Trinity's mind as God's “real” mind, the three others being sub-minds. But this would render the persons of the Trinity less than persons, incapable of truly inter-personal relationships (thus clashing with a major motivation of any social trinitarian theory) (Leftow 1999, 221–4).

C. J. F. Williams tries to avoid this dilemma by positing that the three divine minds share one set of mental states (Williams 1994, 242; Leftow 1999, 224–7). Leftow objects that we have no idea whether or not this is possible (non-contradictory), as we don't know what, if anything, would preserve the distinctness of the minds. Other puzzles arise concerning God and self-reference. Suppose God thinks “I exist”. What does the term “I” refer to there? Not the Trinity, as it is the persons in whom this thought inheres, and on this theory the Trinity is not identical to any of the persons. But as it inheres equally in each of the persons, it is not clear (as orthodoxy and the New Testament would seem to demand) that each person is able to refer to himself alone or be the primary actor in certain actions (e.g., becoming incarnate, dying on a cross) (Leftow 1999, 225–6).

4. Mysterianism

Often “mystery” is used in a merely honorific sense, meaning a great and important truth or thing relating to religion. In this vein it's often said that the doctrine of the Trinity is a mystery to be adored, rather than a problem to be solved. In the Bible a “mystery” (Greek: musterion) is simply a truth or thing which is or has been somehow hidden (i.e., rendered unknowable) by God (Anonymous 1691; Toulmin 1791b). In this sense a “revealed mystery” is a contradiction in terms (Whitby, Hysterai, 101-9). While Paul seems to mainly use “mystery” for what used to be hidden but is now known (Tuggy 2003, 175), it has been argued that Paul assumes that what has been revealed will continue to be in some sense “mysterious” (Boyer 2007, 98-101).

Mysterianism is a meta-theory of the Trinity, that is, a theory about trinitarian theories, to the effect that an acceptable Trinity theory must, given our present epistemic limitations, to some degree lack understandable content. “Understandable content” here means propositions expressed by language which the hearer “grasps” or understands the meaning of, and which seem to her to be consistent.

At its extreme, a mysterian may hold that no first-order theory of the Trinity is possible, so we must be content with delineating a consistent “grammar of discourse” about the Trinity, i.e., policies about what should and shouldn't be said about it. In this extreme form, mysterianism may be a sort of sophisticated position by itself—to the effect that one repeats the creedal formulas and refuses on principle to explain how, if at all, one interprets them. More common is a moderate form, where mysterianism supplements a Trinity theory which has some understandable content, but which is vague or otherwise problematic. Thus, mysterianism is commonly held as a supplement to one of the theories of sections 1–3 above. Again, it may serve as a supplement not to a full-blown theory (i.e., to a literal model of the Trinity) but rather to one or more (admittedly not very helpful) analogies. (See section 3.3.1 in the supplementary document on the history of trinitarian doctrines.) Unitarian views on the Trinity are often partially motivated by hostility to mysterianism. (See the supplementary document on unitarianism.)

Mysterians view their stance as an exercise of theological sophistication and epistemic humility. Some mysterians appeal to the medieval tradition of apophatic or negative theology, the view that one can only say what God is not, but not what God is, while others simply appeal to the idea that the human mind is ill-equipped to think about transcendent realities.

Tuggy lists five different meanings of “mystery” in the literature:

[1]…a truth formerly unknown, and perhaps undiscoverable by unaided human reason, but which has now been revealed by God and is known to some… [2] something we don't completely understand… [3] some fact we can't explain, or can't fully or adequately explain… [4] an unintelligible doctrine, the meaning of which can't be grasped….[5] a truth which one should believe even though it seems, even after careful reflection, to be impossible and/or contradictory and thus false. (Tuggy 2003, 175–6)

Sophisticated mysterians about the Trinity appeal to “mysteries” in the fourth and fifth senses. The common core of meaning between them is that a “mystery” is a doctrine which is (to some degree) not understood, in the sense explained above. We here call those who call the Trinity a mystery in the fourth sense “negative mysterians” and those who call it a mystery in the fifth sense “positive mysterians”. It is most common for theologians to combine the two views, though usually one or the other is emphasized.

Sophisticated latter-day mysterians include Leibniz and the theologian Moses Stuart (1780–1852). (See Antognazza 2007; Leibniz Theodicy, 73–122; Stuart 1834, 26–50.)

4.1 Negative Mysterianism

The negative mysterian holds that the true doctrine of the Trinity is not understandable because it is too poor in intelligible content for it to positively seem either consistent or inconsistent to us. In the pro-Nicene consensus this takes the form of refusing to state in literal language what there are three of in God, how they're related to God or to the divine essence, and how they're related to each other. (See section 3.3 in the supplementary document on the history of Trinity theories.) The “persons” of the Trinity, in this way of thinking, are somewhat like three men, but also somewhat like a mind, its thought, and its will, and also somewhat like a root, a tree, and a branch. Multiple incongruous analogies are given, the idea being that a minimal content of the doctrine is thereby expressed, though we remain unable to convert the non-literal claims to literal ones, and may even be unable to express in what respects the analogies do and don't fit. Negative mysterianism goes hand in hand with the doctrines of divine incomprehensibility (that God or God's essence can't be understood completely, at all, or adequately) and divine ineffability (that no human concept, or at least none of some subset of these, applies literally to God). Some recent studies have emphasized the centrality of negative mysterianism to the pro-Nicene tradition of trinitarian thought, chastising recent theorists who seem to feel unconstrained by it (Ayres 2004; Coakley 1999; Dixon 2003).

Opponents of this sort of mysterianism object to it as misdirection, special pleading, neglect of common sense, or even deliberate obfuscation. They emphasize that trinitarian theories are human constructs, and a desideratum of any theory is clarity. We literally can't believe what is expressed by the trinitarian confessions, if we don't grasp the meaning of them, and to the extent that we don't understand a doctrine, it can't guide our other theological beliefs, our actions, or our worship (Cartwright 1987; Dixon 2003, 125–31; Nye 1691b, 47; Tuggy 2003, 176–80). Negative mysterians reply that it is well-grounded in tradition, and that those who are not naively overconfident in human reason expect some unclarity in the content of the doctrine.

4.2 Positive Mysterianism

In contrast, the positive mysterian holds that the trinitarian doctrine can't be understood because of an abundance of content. That is, the doctrine seems to contain explicit or implicit contradictions. So while we grasp the meaning of its individual claims, taken together they seem inconsistent, and so the conjunction of them is not understandable, in the sense explained above. The positive mysterian holds that the human mind is adequate to understand many truths about God, although it breaks down at a certain stage, when the most profound divinely revealed truths are entertained. Sometimes an analogy with recent physics is offered; if we find mysteries (i.e., apparent contradictions) there, such as light appearing to be both a particle and a wave, why should we be shocked to find them in theology? (van Inwagen 1995, 224–7)

The best-developed positive mysterian theory is that of James Anderson, who develops Alvin Plantinga's epistemology so that beliefs in mysteries (merely apparent contradictions) may be rational, warranted, justified, and known (Anderson 2005, 2007). Orthodox belief about the Trinity, Anderson holds, involves one in believing for example, that Jesus is identical to God, the Father is identical to God, and that Jesus and the Father are not identical. Similarly, one must believe that the Son is omniscient, but lacks knowledge about at least one matter. These, he grants, are apparent contradictions, but for the believer they are strongly warranted and justified by the divine testimony of scripture. He argues that numerous attempts by recent theologians and philosophers to interpret one of the apparently contradictory pairs in a way that makes the pair consistent always result in a lapse of orthodoxy (Anderson 2007, 11–59). He argues that the Christian should take these trinitarian mysteries to be “MACRUEs”, merely apparent contradictions resulting from unarticulated equivocations, and he gives plausible non-theological examples these (220–5).

One might think that if a claim appears contradictory to a person, she thereby by has a strong “defeater” for that belief, i.e., a further belief which robs the first belief of justification and/or warrant. A stock example is a man viewing widgets being made in a factory which appear to be red. The man then learns that a red light is shining on them. In learning this, he acquires a defeater for his belief that all the widgets before him are red. Thus with the Trinity, if the believer discovers an apparent contradiction in (her version of) the doctrine, doesn't that defeat her belief in that doctrine? Anderson argues that it does not, at least, if she reflects properly on the situation. The above thought, Anderson argues, should be countered with the doctrine of divine incomprehensibility, which says that we don't know all there is to know about God. Given this truth, the believer should not be surprised to find herself in the above epistemic situation, and so, the believer's trinitarian belief is either insulated from defeat, or if it's already been defeated, that defeat is undone by the preceding realization (2007, 209–54). For other objections and replies, see Anderson 2007, 263-306.

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