Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Notes to Ambiguity

1. ‘Amphiboly’ is generally thought of as ambiguity due to grammar rather than enshrined lexical meanings. The classic Marx brothers joke ‘I shot an elephant in my pajamas’ is an example of amphiboly.

2. We're playing a bit fast and loose with notion of a word which is philosophically somewhat suspect but hopefully not detrimental to the considerations we will advance. Co-spelling and co-pronounciation, for example, are good signs but maybe not sufficient condition for same words.

3. Thanks to the OSU reading group Synners for suggestions that were invaluable additions to this section.