Notes to Philosophy of Chemistry

1. DG abbreviates De Generatione et Corruptione. All quotations from Aristotle are from The Complete Works (ed. Barnes) unless otherwise indicated.

2. This can be confusing for modern readers with some knowledge of chemistry in view of the distinction commonly drawn between compounds and solutions, both of which may well be homogeneous. But in deference to philosophical tradition we follow this usage here conscious that Aristotle recognized no such distinction.

3. A body with different temperatures in different parts doesn't have a temperature, only its parts do. A body not at equilibrium might not be so turbulent that the laws of irreversible thermodynamics apply, in which case the intensive properties, such as temperature, are ascribed to points and these vary smoothly from one to another. Even here temperature is intensive, the fact that points don't have proper parts notwithstanding, since it still holds that all the parts of a point which has a temperature have the same temperature.