Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Supplement to Common Knowledge

Proof of Lemma 2.16

Lemma 2.16.
M(ω) is common knowledge for the agents of N at ω.

Proof.
Since M is a coarsening of Hi for each iN, Ki(M(ω)). Hence, K1N(M(ω) ), and since by definition Ki(M(ω)) = { ω | Hi(ω) ⊆ M(ω)} = M(ω),

K1N(M(ω)) =  

iN
Ki(M(ω)) = M(ω)

Applying the recursive definition of mutual knowledge, for any m ≥ 1,

KmN(M(ω)) =  

iN
Ki(Km−1N(M(ω)) =  

iN
Ki(M(ω)) = M(ω)

so, since ω ∈ M(ω), by definition we have ω ∈ K*N(M(ω)). □

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