Rubinstein's Proof

[Note: See Definition 3.2 for the notation used in this proof.]

Let T₂ denote the number of messages that Joanna's e-mail system sends, and T₁ denote the number of messages that Lizzi's e-mail system sends. We might suppose that T_i appears on each agent's computer screen. If T₁ = 0, then Lizzi sends no message, that is, ω₁ has occurred, in which case Lizzi's unique best response is to choose A. If T₂ = 0, then Joanna did not receive a message. She knows that in this case, either ω₁ has occurred and Lizzi did not send her a message, which occurs with probability .51, or ω₂ has occurred and Lizzi sent her a message which did not arrive, which occurs with probability .49ε. If ω₁ has occurred, then Lizzi is sure to choose A, so Joanna knows that whatever Lizzi might do at ω₂,

E(u2(A) | T2=0)	≥	2(.51) + 0(.49)ε .51 + .49ε
	>	−4(.51) + 2(.49)ε .51 + .49ε
	≥	E(u2(B) | T2=0 )

so Joanna is strictly better off choosing A no matter what Lizzi does at either state of the world.

Suppose next that for all T_i < t, each agents' unique best response given her expectations regarding the other agent is A, so that the unique Nash equilibrium of the game is (A,A). Assume that T₁ = t. Lizzi is uncertain whether T₂ = t, which is the case if Joanna received Lizzi's t^th automatic confirmation and Joanna's t^th confirmation was lost, or if T₂ = t − 1, which is the case if Lizzi's t^th confirmation was lost. Then

μ1(T2 = t−1 | T1 = t)	=	z
	=	ε ε + (1−ε)ε
	>	½.[1]

Thus it is more likely that Lizzi's last confirmation did not arrive than that Joanna did receive this message. By the inductive assumption, Lizzi assesses that Joanna will choose A if T₂ = t−1. So

E(u1(B) | T1 = t)	≤	−4z + 2(1−z)
	=	−6z + 2
	<	−3 + 2
	=	−1,

and

E(u₁(A) | T₁ = t) = 0

since Lizzi knows that ω₂ is the case. So Lizzi's unique best action is A. Similarly, one can show that A is Joanna's best reply if T₂ = t. So by induction, (A,A) is the unique Nash equilibrium of the game for every t ≥ 0.

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